## Appendix: Global Lyapunov Exponents

One way to get a handle on global Lyapunov exponents is to see how they arise out of linear stability analysis of the trajectories of evolution equations. Consider the first-order, ordinary differential equation system $$d\bx/dt = \bF\bx$$ and suppose that $$\bx^*$$ is a steady point, i.e. a point at which $$\bF(\bx^*) = 0$$. We can study the behavior of trajectories near $$\bx^*$$ by considering $$\bx(t) = \bx^* + \varepsilon(t)$$, where $$\varepsilon(t)$$ is an infinitesimal perturbation to every component of $$\bx$$. Substituting back into $$\bF$$ and expanding to first order in $$\varepsilon(t)$$ (considering only the perturbations at $$t = 0$$ and dropping the explicit dependence on $$t$$ from $$\varepsilon)$$ yields

$\tag{A1} \bF(\bx^* + \varepsilon) = \bF(\bx^*) + \bJ(\bx^*)\varepsilon + O(\varepsilon^2),$

where the matrix $$\bJ(\bx)$$ is the $$n\times n$$ Jacobian matrix of partial derivatives of $$\bF$$ evaluated at the point $$\bx$$. We then obtain an equation for the time dependence of the perturbation of $$\bx$$, namely

$\tag{A2} \frac{d\varepsilon}{dt} = \bJ(\bx^*)\varepsilon + O(\varepsilon^2).$

A linear stability analysis results if we neglect terms of $$\varepsilon^{2}$$ or higher powers in (A2). If $$\varepsilon$$ is a real-valued vector and $$\bJ$$ a real-valued matrix (i.e., having no complex values), and we assume a solution of the form $$\varepsilon = \lambda e^{st}$$, (A2) reduces to the eigenvalue equation

$\tag{A3} \bJ\lambda = s\lambda.$

Linear stability analysis can be used to characterize Lyapunov exponents for nonlinear systems of equations. Consider the initial condition $$\bx(0)$$ for our first-order system of differential equations and an infinitesimal displacement from $$\bx(0)$$ in the direction of some tangent vector, $$\by(0)$$. Then the evolution of $$\by$$ according to (A2) is given by

$\tag{A4} \frac{d\by}{dt} = \bJ(\bx)\cdot\by,$

valid for only an infinitesimal neighborhood about $$\bx$$(0). So the value of the vector $$\by$$ changes in time according to the values $$\bJ$$ takes on over time. Here $$\by/|\by|$$ gives the direction of the infinitesimal displacement from $$\bx$$, where the bars indicate absolute magnitude. Additionally, $$|\by|/|\by(0)|$$ gives the factor by which the infinitesimal displacement grows (|$$\by|\gt |\by$$(0)|) or shrinks (|$$\by|\lt |\by$$(0)|). The Lyapunov exponent is now defined with respect to initial condition $$\bx$$(0) and initial orientation of the infinitesimal displacement $$\by(0)/|\by(0)|$$ as

\begin{align*}\tag{A5} \lambda(\bx(0), \frac{\by}{\by(0)}) &= \lim_{t\rightarrow \infty} t^{-1} \ln\left(\frac{d\by/dt}{\by(0)}\right) \\ &= \lim_{t\rightarrow \infty} t^{-1} \ln\left(\frac{\bJ(x)\cdot\by}{\by(0)}\right) \end{align*}

For an $$n$$-dimensional system, there will be at most $$n$$ distinct Lyapunov exponents for a given $$\bx$$(0), and the relevant exponent is picked out by the initial orientation $$\by(0)/ |\by(0)|$$. The infinite time limit plays an important role in this analysis as it indicates that the Lyapunov exponents represent time-averaged quantities (meaning that transient behavior has decayed). The existence of this limit is guaranteed by Oseledec’s (1969) multiplicative ergodic theorem, which holds under mild conditions. In addition, $$\bJ$$ is a constant in space in this limit (otherwise its value varies in space), and the Lyapunov exponents obtained from (A5) are then the same for almost every value of $$\bx(0)$$. Hence, one often drops the dependence on the initial condition in (A5). Such exponents are usually called global Lyapunov exponents.