## The Argument: Death and Posthumous Events Don’t Affect Us

Here is a more explicit version of 1–13 (with thanks to Curtis Brown):

Let $$s,s',\ldots$$ range over subjects; $$v,v',\ldots$$ over events and states; and $$t,t',\ldots$$ over times. We can use the following abbreviations:

 $$\SD(v,s,t)$$: $$v$$ is the state of $$s$$ being dead at $$t$$ $$\harm 2(v,s)$$: $$v$$ harms $$s$$ $$\harm 3(v,s,t)$$: $$v$$ harms $$s$$ at $$t$$ $$t \gt$$ t’: $$t$$ is after $$t'$$ $$t \ge t'$$: $$t$$ is after $$t'$$ or $$t = t'$$

We can use the following function symbols:

For any subject $$s$$, $$\ED(s)$$ is the event of $$s$$’s death

For any event or state $$v$$, T$$(v)$$ is the time $$v$$ occurs or holds

Next come axioms:

 A1. $$\forall v\forall s(\harm 2(v,s)$$ iff $$\exists t \harm 3(v,s,t))$$ A2. $$\forall v\forall s(v$$ is posthumous for $$s$$ iff T$$(v) \gt \T(\ED(s)))$$ A3. $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$(If $$\SD(v,s)$$, then $$t \gt \T(\ED(s)))$$

Then premises:

 P1. $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$v$$ affects $$s$$ at $$t$$, then $$v$$ causally affects $$s$$ at $$t)$$ P2. $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$v$$ causally affects $$s$$ at $$t$$, then $$s$$ exists at $$t)$$ P3. $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$\harm 3(v,s,t)$$, then $$v$$ affects $$s$$ at $$t)$$ P4. $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$v$$ causally affects $$s$$ at $$t$$, then $$t \ge$$ T$$(v))$$ P5. $$\forall v\forall s$$ (If $$t \gt \T(\ED(s))$$, then it is not the case that $$s$$ exists at $$t)$$

Here are the conclusions to be reached:

 C1. No posthumous event harms us; i.e., $$\forall v\forall s$$ (If $$v$$ is posthumous for $$s$$, then $${\sim}\harm 2(v,s))$$ C2. We are not harmed by the state of our being dead; i.e., $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$\SD(v,s,t)$$, then $${\sim}\harm 2(v,s))$$ C3. The event of death harms us, if at all, only when it occurs; i.e., $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$v=\ED(s) \amp \harm 3(v,s,t)$$, then $$t = \T(\ED(s)))$$

Argument for C1:

Let $$v_{1}$$ be any event or state, $$s_{1}$$ any subject and $$t_{1}$$ any time.

 1 $$v_{1}$$ is posthumous for $$s_{1}$$ (assumption for conditional introduction) 2 $$\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})$$ (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) 3 $$\T(v_{1}) \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (1, A2, UI, biconditional elimination) 4 $$\harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1},t)$$ (2, A1, UI, biconditional elimination, MP) 5 $$\harm 3(v_{1}$$, $$s_{1}, t_{1})$$ (4, EI) 6 $$v_{1}$$ affects $$s_{1}$$ at $$t_{1}$$ (5, P3, UI, MP) 7 $$v_{1}$$ causally affects $$s_{1}$$ at $$t_{1}$$ (6, P1, UI, MP) 8 $$t_{1} \gt \T(v_{1})$$ (7, P4, UI, MP) 9 $$t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (8, 3, transitivity of $$\gt)$$ 10 $${\sim}s_{1}$$ exists at $$t_{1}$$ (9, P5, UI, MP) 11 $$s_{1}$$ exists at $$t_{1}$$ (7, P2, UI, MP) 12 $${\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})$$ (2, 10,11, reductio ad absurdum 13 If $$v_{1}$$ is posthumous for s $$_{1}$$, then $${\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})$$ (1, 13, conditional introduction) 14 $$\forall v\forall s$$(If $$v$$ is posthumous for $$s$$, then $${\sim}\harm 2(v,s))$$ (13 UG)

Argument for C2:

Let $$v_{1}$$ be any event or state, $$s_{1}$$ any subject and t $$_{1}$$ any time.

 1 $$\SD(v_{1}, s_{1}, t_{1})$$ (assumption for conditional introduction) 2 $$t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (1, A3, UI, MP)) 3 $$v_{1}$$ is posthumous for $$s_{1}$$ (2, A2, biconditional elimination) 4 $${\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})$$ (3, C1, UI, MP) 5 If $$\SD(v_{1}, s_{1}, t_{1})$$, then $${\sim} \harm 2( v_{1}, s_{1})$$ (1, 4, CI) 6 $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$\SD(v,s,t)$$, then $${\sim}\harm 2(v,s))$$ (5, UG)

Argument for C3:

Let $$v_{1}$$ be any event or state, $$s_{1}$$ any subject and $$t_{1}$$ any time.

 1 $$v_{1} =\ED(s_{1}) \amp \harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1},t_{1})$$ (assumption for conditional introduction) 2 $$\harm 3(\ED(s_{1}),s_{1},t_{1})$$ (1, simplication, substitution) 3 $$\ED(s_{1})$$ affects $$s_{1}$$ at $$t_{1}$$ (2, P3, UI, MP) 4 $$\ED(s_{1})$$ causally affects $$s_{1}$$ at $$t_{1}$$ (3, P1, UI, MP) 5 $$t_{1} \ge \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (4, P4, UI, MP) 6 $$t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) 7 $${\sim}s_{1}$$ exists at $$t_{1}$$ (6, P5, UI, MP) 8 $$s_{1}$$ exists at $$t_{1}$$ (4, P2, UI, MP) 9 $${\sim}t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (6, 8, reductio ad absurdum) 10 $$t_{1} = \T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (5, 9, disjunctive syllogism) 11 If $$v_{1}=\ED(s_{1})\amp \harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1} , t_{1})$$, then $$t_{1} =\T(\ED(s_{1}))$$ (1, 10, conditional introduction) 12 $$\forall v\forall s\forall t$$ (If $$v=\ED(s) \amp \harm 3(v,s,t)$$, then $$t = \T(\ED((s))$$ (11, UG)