Notes to Analytic Feminism

1. Although it can be very useful to draw distinctions among various terms, e.g., “androcentrism”, “sexism”, “male bias”, “masculism”, etc., in this essay “male bias” is a shorthand way to identify a category that includes the others. See Anderson (1995), E. Lloyd (1995a), and Harding (1986, 1991) for various sets of useful distinctions among such categories.

2. In a book of interviews edited by Giovanna Borradori, The American Philosopher (1994), W.V. Quine acquiesces to being labeled post-analytic, and Hilary Putnam notes that mid-twentieth-century analytic philosophers wouldn’t recognize what is called analytic philosophy today. Philosophers seem not to use “neo-analytic” to identify either themselves or others. This might result from the ongoing internal process of change in analytic philosophy (in contrast with pragmatists/neo-pragmatists) or from the fact that there are more specific descriptions that characterize the changes, e.g., social epistemology.

3. The author has made it a point to converse informally about such matters with feminist philosophers from continents other than North America. Individual feminists outside of Anglophone countries differ over the degree to which they identify as analytic feminists, given that to be seen as both analytic and feminist might function as two strikes against them. Nevertheless, some feminists do what North Americans call “analytic feminism” in all Anglophone countries, much of Western Europe, Argentina, and no doubt many other countries as well.

4. Jaggar presented this schema in a May 1972 talk at the American Philosophical Association, “Four Views of Women’s Liberation”, in which she cited socialist feminism and lesbian separatism as “new directions”. A revised version was later published as “Political Philosophies of Women’s Liberation” in Vetterling-Braggin, Elliston, & English 1977. She develops her views fully in her book Feminist Politics and Human Nature (1983)

5. Louise Antony (1993, 2003) and Harriet Baber (1993) are among those who reject various inferences between liberalism and their method and theory preferences as analytic philosophers. See also Vogler (1995) for a discussion of liberalism, humanism and philosophical feminism. Concerning empiricism, it is likely that those who want to call themselves empiricists are not all using the term in the same way.

6. Of course, comparable bridge building takes place by feminists in other philosophical traditions as well. Feminist pragmatists and feminist phenomenologists build bridges both with feminists outside their methodological traditions and with nonfeminist pragmatists or phenomenologists. Although many participants in such “bridge-building” conversations may lack background in their feminist colleagues’ traditions, they nevertheless progress in their understanding of each other.

7. See the Symposium “Intra-Feminist Criticism and the ‘Rules of Engagement’” in Garry, ed., APA Newsletter on Feminism and Philosophy, Spring 2001, especially the essays by Frye, Garry, Nussbaum, and Scheman.

8. Marilyn Frye (1983) Eve Kosofsky Sedgwick (1990), Patricia Hill Collins (1990), and Charles Mills (1997), among others, all deserve credit as forerunners of the blossoming discourse around epistemic ignorance/injustice/oppression. Note also that there is work on “ontic injustice” (e.g., Jenkins 2020) and “discursive injustice” (e.g., Kukla 2014).

9. Scheman cites a passage from Wittgenstein,

The sickness of a time is cured by an alteration in the mode of life of human beings, and it was possible for the sickness of philosophical problems to get cured only through a changed mode of thought and of life, not through a medicine invented by an individual. (1956 [1967: 57])

10. Something like my wider sense of “naturalized” goes by various terms, e.g., Kornblith’s “weaker” version of naturalized epistemology (Kornblith 1994: 3). But given that Kornblith and many other nonfeminist naturalizing philosophers often focus on the “individual” not the “social” sciences, my use of “naturalized” is even wider than Kornblith’s. We will discuss feminist criticisms of naturalized epistemology in Section 8. See, for example, Code (1996), Campbell (1998), and Rooney (2003) among others. For more detail on feminist social epistemology see Heidi Grasswick’s entry on feminist social epistemology.

Although I and many others categorize social epistemology as a type of naturalized epistemology, not everyone agrees. Maureen Linker advocates social epistemology that is not a form of naturalized epistemology, but a “revised rationalized approach to knowledge that takes into account social responsibility” (2003: 167). Linker believes that her view better defends against relativism than can naturalized epistemologies based on Quine, for example, that of Lynn Hankinson Nelson.

11. Richmond Campbell has interesting criticisms of Antony’s arguments. He also presents his own version of feminist naturalized epistemology that incorporates moral as well as empirical knowledge. See Campbell 1998, 2001.

12. Responses to Nussbaum and others are discussed briefly in Section 7. Nussbaum discusses her approach to criticizing other feminists in Nussbaum, 2001. See also note 7 above.

13. An earlier, archived version of the present entry (Summer 2012: Section 8) contains brief updates in some other areas of feminist scholarship through 2012 in areas not listed below, e.g., Wittgenstein and Logic.

Copyright © 2021 by
Ann Garry <ann.garryz@gmail.com>

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