Notes to Ibn Kammūna

1. The most thorough analyses of this key chapter in the history of psychology, and the basis for all subsequent research (even if not always given their proper due by some scholars), remain the two articles of Shlomo Pines, “La Conception de la Conscience de soi chez Avicenne et chez Abu‘l-Barakat al-Baghdadi” (1954) and “Studies in Abu‘l-Barakat’s Poetics and Metaphysics” (1960), both of which are reprinted in the first volume of Pines 1979–1989. There are some passing references to Ibn Kammuna in these seminal studies.

2. Interpretations differ concerning the precise role of intuition in Suhrawardi’s thought; for a good overview, see Marcotte 1996.

3. See Gutas 1988, 176, 78, where the term appears in a letter written by an anonymous disciple of Ibn Sina. For the Sufi usage see, e.g., Schimmel 1975, 193.

4. For some examples of such snippets, as well as further discussion of the assimilation of Islamic piety among some Jews in the Yemen, see Langermann 2003.

5. Our account here is based upon the Arabic text of Ibn Kammuna transcribed in Pourjavady and Schmidtke 2006, 45, n. 201, and al-Tusi’s reply, 209–210. In addition to the manuscripts listed by Pourjavady and Schmidtke, interested readers can be referred now to an online resource, Manuscript 35 in the Minasian collection at UCLA, 160ff., digitized images of which have been made public.

Copyright © 2022 by
Tzvi Langermann

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