Notes to Logical Pluralism

1. More carefully: their adherents take them to disagree; whether or not that disagreement is genuine is another controversial issue.

2. The word “true” in the common term of art “One True Logic” is most naturally understood by analogy with the expression in phrases like “one true king”, “one true love”, or “true calling”; most saliently, it is not intended to be restricted to objects which are potential bearers of the familiar semantic properties of truth and falsehood, and it means something like “genuine” or “legitimate”.

3. Beall and Restall intend this point as a reductio on the assumption that logic is absolutely general; they do not mean it as an argument for logical nihilism. Still, some authors have taken the prospect of logical nihilism more seriously, adding an additional option to the field that includes logical pluralism and logical monism (Mortensen 1989; Cotnoir 2018; Russell 2018).

4. Such variation was already present in contemporary accounts of logical consequence, and Etchemendy 1999 provides an excellent discussion that introduces the distinction between representational and interpretational accounts of consequence. See also Sher 1996.

5. Here Frege is saying that the laws of thought follow from the laws of truth (i.e., logic) and he immediately goes on to deny that logic itself is the study of the laws of thought. See Russell (2020) for doubts about whether logic is normative.

6. The one view that does not fit so easily into such a form is the more radical of Cook’s pluralisms characterised below.

7. As Keefe (2014: 1377) notes, Beall and Restall (2006: 88, emphasis in original) are themselves keen to distinguish their view from relativism, writing “we do not take logical consequence to be relative to languages, communities of inquiry, contexts, or anything else”.

8. For other ways of interpreting both pluralism and monism, and why they don’t straightforwardly yield substantive theses, see Eklund (2020) and Clarke-Doane (manuscript [Other Internet Resources]). Note that there are also semantic and telic versions of domain-relative pluralism.

9. That there are no correct logics follows from our earlier understanding of logical nihilism as the claim that there are no logically valid argument forms, on the assumption that a correct logic has at least some valid argument forms.

Copyright © 2023 by
Gillian Russell <gillian.russell@acu.edu.au>
Christopher Blake-Turner <cblaket@okstate.edu>

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