(Librarians please register your institution's commitment with SOLINET. We are grateful to these institutions that have already registered support.)

The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (SEP) needs your support. Over 1000 professional philosophers are donating their time and labor to collaboratively write, referee, and maintain our reference work. Our goal is to offer high-quality and authoritative discussions of values, science, religion, politics, and ideas in general. Our authors and editors are jointly producing entries on such topics as democracy, civil rights, quantum mechanics, consciousness, voluntary euthanasia, and on many other topics important to the human condition, all freely available.

To cover the annual costs of administering and supporting this volunteer effort, Stanford University has partnered with the Southeastern Library Network (SOLINET), the International Coalition of Library Consortia (ICOLC), the Scholarly Publishing and Academic Resources Coalition (SPARC), and Indiana University Libraries for the purpose of building a protected operating fund for the SEP. While the library organizations attempt to raise $3 million for the SEP over the course of 3 years (primarily from libraries at academic institutions offering degrees in philosophy), we here at Stanford hope to raise $1.125 million from private individuals and corporations during that same time period. The SEP would then live off the interest on that $4.125 million fund.

The National Endowment for the Humanities has endorsed and supported our efforts by awarding the library organizations (SOLINET, ICOLC, and SPARC) a $500,000 Challenge Grant (in December 2004). So if the library organizations can raise $1.5 million from their member libraries (i.e., half of their $3 million goal), the NEH will contribute $500,000, bringing the libraries to 2/3 of their fund-raising goal. Indiana University Libraries has now sponsored a special membership organization, the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy International Association (SEPIA), for the purpose of collecting membership dues. These membership dues are eligible for matching funds from the NEH.

As a reader of the SEP, we are asking you to help us here at Stanford to reach our fundraising goal of $1.125 million, by making a generous tax-deductible contribution, so that the SEP can continue to remain freely available to everyone with access to the world wide web. We hope that either our fundraising flyer (linked in above) or one of the open letters (linked in below) will convince you that our project is worthy of your support. In addition, we ask professional scholars to please read the open letter addressed to them, and start a constructive dialogue with librarians at your institution to enlist their support for the SEP.