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Tue, 09 Feb 2010 18:15:08 -0800 Tue, 09 Feb 2010 18:15:08 -0800 editors@plato.stanford.edu (Stanford Encyclopedia Editor) webmaster@plato.stanford.edu (Webmaster) http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/mysticism/ [Revised entry by Jerome Gellman on February 9, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] The term 'mysticism,' comes from the Greek muo, meaning "to conceal." In the Hellenistic world, 'mystical' referred to "secret" religious rituals. In early Christianity the term came to refer to "hidden" allegorical interpretations of Scriptures and to hidden presences, such as that of Jesus at the... Jerome Gellman Tue, 09 Feb 2010 18:11:08 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/mysticism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/reasoning-automated/ [Revised entry by Frederic Portoraro on February 8, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources] Reasoning is the ability to make inferences, and automated reasoning is concerned with the building of computing systems that automate this process. Although the overall goal is to mechanize different forms of reasoning, the term has largely been identified with valid deductive reasoning as practiced in mathematics and formal logic. In this respect, automated reasoning is akin to mechanical theorem proving.... Frederic Portoraro Mon, 08 Feb 2010 19:51:26 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/reasoning-automated/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/intensional-trans-verbs/ [Revised entry by Graeme Forbes on February 5, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, notes.html] A verb is transitive iff it usually occurs with a direct object, and in such occurrences it is said to occur transitively. Thus 'ate' occurs transitively in 'I ate the meat and left the vegetables', but not in 'I ate then left' (perhaps it is not the same verb 'left' in these two examples, but it seems to be the same... Graeme Forbes Fri, 05 Feb 2010 18:11:45 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/intensional-trans-verbs/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/eternity/ [Revised entry by Paul Helm on February 4, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Concepts of eternity have developed in a way that is, as a matter of fact, closely connected to the development of the concept of God in Western thought, beginning with ancient Greek philosophers; particularly to the idea of God's relation to time, the idea of divine perfection, and the Creator-creature distinction. Eternity as timelessness, and eternity as everlastingness, have been... Paul Helm Thu, 04 Feb 2010 20:14:33 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/eternity/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/content-causal/ [New Entry by Fred Adams and Ken Aizawa on February 4, 2010.] Causal theories of mental content attempt to explain how thoughts can be about things. They attempt to explain how one can think about, for example, dogs. These theories begin with the idea that there are mental representations and that thoughts are meaningful in virtue of a causal connection between a mental representation and some part of the world that is represented. In other words, the point of... Fred Adams and Ken Aizawa Thu, 04 Feb 2010 19:13:17 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/content-causal/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/heidegger-aesthetics/ [New Entry by Iain Thomson on February 4, 2010.] Heidegger is against the modern tradition of philosophical "aesthetics" because he is for the true "work of art" which, he argues, the aesthetic approach to art eclipses. Heidegger's critique of aesthetics and his advocacy of art thus form a complimentary whole. Section 1 orients the reader by providing a brief overview of Heidegger's philosophical stand... Iain Thomson Thu, 04 Feb 2010 18:25:30 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/heidegger-aesthetics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/memory/ [Revised entry by John Sutton on February 3, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] 'Memory' labels a diverse set of cognitive capacities by which we retain information and reconstruct past experiences, usually for present purposes. Memory is one of the most important ways by which our histories animate our current actions and experiences. Most notably, the human ability to conjure up long-gone but specific episodes of our lives is both familiar and puzzling, and is a key... John Sutton Wed, 03 Feb 2010 22:31:26 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/memory/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/consciousness-animal/ [Revised entry by Colin Allen on February 3, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources, doubleinduction.jpg, notes.html] There are many reasons for philosophical interest in nonhuman animal (hereafter "animal") consciousness. First, if philosophy often begins with questions about the place of humans in nature, one way humans have attempted to locate themselves is by comparison and contrast with those things in nature most similar to themselves, i.e., other animals. Second, the problem of determining... Colin Allen Wed, 03 Feb 2010 18:09:26 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/consciousness-animal/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/introspection/ [New Entry by Eric Schwitzgebel on February 2, 2010.] Introspection, as the term is used in contemporary philosophy of mind, is a means of learning about one's own currently ongoing, or perhaps very recently past, mental states or processes. You can, of course, learn about your own mind in the same way you learn about others' minds - by reading psychology texts, by observing facial expressions (in a mirror), by examining readouts of brain activity, by... Eric Schwitzgebel Tue, 02 Feb 2010 23:02:17 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/introspection/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/omniscience/ [New Entry by Edward Wierenga on February 1, 2010.] Omniscience is the property of having complete or maximal knowledge. Along with omnipotence and perfect goodness it is usually taken to be one the central divine attributes. Philosophical considerations of omniscience often derive... Edward Wierenga Mon, 01 Feb 2010 20:26:04 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/omniscience/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/brentano/ [Revised entry by Wolfgang Huemer on February 1, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Franz Clemens Brentano (1838 - 1917) is mainly known for his work in philosophy of psychology, especially for having introduced the notion of intentionality to contemporary philosophy. He also made important contributions to many fields in philosophy, especially to ethics, ontology, logic, the history of philosophy, and philosophical theology. Brentano was strongly influenced by Aristotle and the... Wolfgang Huemer Mon, 01 Feb 2010 20:13:47 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/brentano/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-rhetoric/ [Revised entry by Christof Rapp on February 1, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, supplement.html, supplement2.html] Aristotle's Rhetoric has had an enormous influence on the development of the art of rhetoric. Not only authors writing in the peripatetic tradition, but also the famous Roman teachers of rhetoric, such as Cicero and Quintilian, frequently used elements stemming from the Aristotelian doctrine. Nevertheless, these authors were interested neither in an authentic interpretation of the... Christof Rapp Mon, 01 Feb 2010 19:32:29 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-rhetoric/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/wollstonecraft/ [Revised entry by Sylvana Tomaselli on January 29, 2010. Changes to: Bibliography] Mary Wollstonecraft (1759 - 1798) was a moral and political theorist whose analysis of the condition of women in modern society retains much of its original radicalism. One of the reasons her pronouncements on the subject remain challenging is that her reflections on the status of the female sex were part of an attempt to come to a comprehensive understanding of human relations within a civilization increasingly... Sylvana Tomaselli Fri, 29 Jan 2010 14:59:51 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/wollstonecraft/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/neutral-monism/ [Revised entry by Leopold Stubenberg on January 28, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Neutral monism is a monistic metaphysics. It holds that ultimate reality is all of one kind. To this extent neutral monism is in agreement with idealism and materialism. What distinguishes neutral monism from its better known monistic rivals is the claim that the intrinsic nature of ultimate reality is neither mental nor physical. This negative claim also captures the idea of neutrality: being... Leopold Stubenberg Thu, 28 Jan 2010 20:29:24 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/neutral-monism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/species/ [Revised entry by Marc Ereshefsky on January 27, 2010. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] The nature of species is controversial in biology and philosophy. Biologists disagree on the definition of the term 'species,' and philosophers disagree over the ontological status of species. Yet a proper understanding of species is important for a number of reasons. Species are the fundamental taxonomic units of biological classification. Environmental laws are framed in terms of... Marc Ereshefsky Wed, 27 Jan 2010 21:52:38 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/species/