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Thu, 09 Feb 2012 18:50:18 -0800 Thu, 09 Feb 2012 18:50:18 -0800 editors@plato.stanford.edu (Stanford Encyclopedia Editor) webmaster@plato.stanford.edu (Webmaster) http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/chance-randomness/ [Revised entry by Antony Eagle on February 9, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, algorithmic-randomness.html, basic-chance.html, notes.html, proofs.html] Chance and randomness are closely related. So much so, in fact, that to say an event happened by chance is near enough synonymous in ordinary English with saying it happened randomly. This suggests that ordinary speakers would by and large endorse this Commonplace Thesis:... Antony Eagle Thu, 09 Feb 2012 18:46:32 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/chance-randomness/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/identity-politics/ [Revised entry by Cressida Heyes on February 7, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] The laden phrase "identity politics" has come to signify a wide range of political activity and theorizing founded in the shared experiences of injustice of members of certain social groups. Rather than organizing solely around belief systems, programmatic manifestos, or party affiliation, identity political formations typically aim to secure the political freedom of a specific... Cressida Heyes Tue, 07 Feb 2012 18:39:26 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/identity-politics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/equivME/ [Revised entry by Francisco Fernflores on February 6, 2012. Changes to: Main text] Einstein correctly described the equivalence of mass and energy as "the most important upshot of the special theory of relativity" (Einstein, 1919), for this result lies at the core of modern physics. According to Einstein's famous equation E = mc2, the energy E of a physical system is numerically equal to the product of its mass... Francisco Fernflores Mon, 06 Feb 2012 16:12:09 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/equivME/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/plato-rhetoric/ [Revised entry by Charles L. Griswold on January 30, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, notes.html] Plato's discussions of rhetoric and poetry are both extensive and influential. As in so many other cases, he sets the agenda for the subsequent tradition. And yet understanding his remarks about each of these topics - rhetoric and poetry - presents us with significant philosophical and interpretive challenges. Further, it is not initially clear why he links the two topics together so closely... Charles L. Griswold Mon, 30 Jan 2012 20:24:37 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/plato-rhetoric/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/bolzano/ [Revised entry by Edgar Morscher on January 30, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, bolzano-logical-truth.html] Bernard Bolzano (1781 - 1848) was a Catholic priest, a professor of the doctrine of Catholic religion at the Philosophical Faculty of the University of Prague, an outstanding mathematician and one of the greatest logicians or even (as some would have it) the greatest logician who lived in the long stretch of time between Leibniz and Frege. As far as logic is concerned, Bolzano anticipated... Edgar Morscher Mon, 30 Jan 2012 19:35:31 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/bolzano/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spinoza-physics/ [Revised entry by Richard Manning on January 30, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Spinoza's thought stands at an uneasy and volatile period in the development of physical theory. His physical science is largely Cartesian, both in content and rationalistic method. It is harshly dismissive of the "occult qualities, intentional species, substantial forms, and a thousand other trifles" (letter 60, to Boxel) of pre-revolutionary scholastic natural philosophy. It is... Richard Manning Mon, 30 Jan 2012 18:35:38 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spinoza-physics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/parenthood/ [Revised entry by Elizabeth Brake and Joseph Millum on January 26, 2012. Changes to: 0] The ethics of parenthood and procreation apply not only to daily acts of decision-making by parents and prospective procreators, but also to law, public policy, and medicine. Two recent social and technological shifts make this topic especially pressing. First, changing family demographics in North America and Europe mean that children are increasingly reared in blended families, by single... Elizabeth Brake and Joseph Millum Thu, 26 Jan 2012 19:16:02 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/parenthood/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/margaret-fell/ [New Entry by Jacqueline Broad on January 26, 2012.] On the strength of her 1666 pamphlet, Womens Speaking Justified, the Quaker writer Margaret Fell has been hailed as a feminist pioneer. In this short tract, Fell puts forward several arguments in favour of women's preaching. She asserts the spiritual equality of the sexes, she appeals to female exempla in the Bible, and she reinterprets key scriptural passages that appear to... Jacqueline Broad Thu, 26 Jan 2012 17:50:34 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/margaret-fell/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/metaethics/ [Revised entry by Geoff Sayre-McCord on January 26, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, notes.html] Metaethics is the attempt to understand the metaphysical, epistemological, semantic, and psychological, presuppositions and commitments of moral thought, talk, and practice. As such, it counts within its domain a broad range of questions and puzzles, including: Is morality more a matter of taste than truth? Are moral standards culturally relative? Are there moral facts? If there are moral facts,... Geoff Sayre-McCord Thu, 26 Jan 2012 17:30:19 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/metaethics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/communitarianism/ [Revised entry by Daniel Bell on January 25, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources] Modern-day communitarianism began in the upper reaches of Anglo-American academia in the form of a critical reaction to John Rawls' landmark 1971 book A Theory of Justice (Rawls 1971). Drawing primarily upon the insights of Aristotle and Hegel, political philosophers such as Alasdair MacIntyre, Michael Sandel, Charles Taylor and Michael Walzer disputed Rawls' assumption that the... Daniel Bell Wed, 25 Jan 2012 20:06:00 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/communitarianism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-natphil/ [Revised entry by Istvan Bodnar on January 16, 2012. Changes to: Bibliography, Internet resources, notes.html] Aristotle had a lifelong interest in the study of nature. He investigated a variety of different topics, ranging from general issues like motion, causation, place and time, to systematic explorations and explanations of natural phenomena across different kinds of natural entities. These different inquiries are integrated into the framework of a single overarching enterprise describing the... Istvan Bodnar Mon, 16 Jan 2012 21:54:41 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-natphil/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/omnipotence/ [Revised entry by Joshua Hoffman and Gary Rosenkrantz on January 12, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Omnipotence is maximal power. Maximal greatness (or perfection) includes omnipotence. According to traditional Western theism, God is maximally great (or perfect), and therefore is omnipotent. Omnipotence seems puzzling, even paradoxical, to many philosophers. They wonder, for example, whether God can create a spherical cube, or make a stone so massive that he cannot move it. Is there a consistent analysis of... Joshua Hoffman and Gary Rosenkrantz Thu, 12 Jan 2012 21:47:43 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/omnipotence/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/authority/ [Revised entry by Tom Christiano on January 11, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] When is political authority legitimate? This is one of the fundamental questions of political philosophy. Depending on how one understands political authority this question may be the same as, when is coercion by the state legitimate? Or, when we do have duties to obey the state? Or, when and who has a right to rule through the state?... Tom Christiano Wed, 11 Jan 2012 19:02:17 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/authority/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/zeno-elea/ [Revised entry by John Palmer on January 11, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Zeno of Elea, 5th c. B.C.E. thinker, is known exclusively for propounding a number of ingenious paradoxes. The most famous of these purport to show that motion is impossible by bringing to light apparent or latent contradictions in ordinary assumptions regarding its occurrence. Zeno also argued against the commonsense assumption that there are many things by showing in various ways how it, too,... John Palmer Wed, 11 Jan 2012 16:49:00 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/zeno-elea/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/dispositions/ [Revised entry by Sungho Choi and Michael Fara on January 5, 2012. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, supplement.html] A glass has certain dispositions, for example the disposition to shatter when struck. But what is this disposition? It seems on the one hand to be a perfectly real property, a genuine respect of similarity common to glasses, china cups, and anything else fragile. Yet on the other hand, the glass's disposition seems mysterious, 'ethereal' (as Goodman (1954) put it) in a way that, say,... Sungho Choi and Michael Fara Thu, 05 Jan 2012 17:49:35 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/dispositions/