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Tue, 18 Jun 2013 15:39:56 -0800 Tue, 18 Jun 2013 15:39:56 -0800 editors@plato.stanford.edu (Stanford Encyclopedia Editor) webmaster@plato.stanford.edu (Webmaster) http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/leibniz-exoteric/ [New Entry by John Whipple on June 18, 2013.] It is no secret that G. W. Leibniz is a difficult philosopher to study. One central reason for this is that the content of his philosophy is extremely challenging. It involves a range of subtle distinctions and paradoxical theses, such as the denial of causal interaction between substances and the thesis that each substance expresses every other substance in the universe. Just... John Whipple Tue, 18 Jun 2013 15:36:22 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/leibniz-exoteric/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/paradox-stpetersburg/ [Revised entry by Robert Martin on June 17, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Petersburg-Paradox-tp.png] The St. Petersburg game is played by flipping a fair coin until it comes up tails, and the total number of flips, n, determines the prize, which equals $2n. Thus if the coin comes up tails the first time, the prize is $21 = $2, and the game ends. If the coin comes up heads the first time, it is flipped again. If it comes up tails the second time, the prize is $22 = $4,... Robert Martin Mon, 17 Jun 2013 16:30:41 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/paradox-stpetersburg/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/galileo/ [Revised entry by Peter Machamer on June 13, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Galileo Galilei (1564 - 1642) has always played a key role in any history of science and, in many histories of philosophy, he is a, if not the, central figure of the scientific revolution of the 17th Century. His work in physics or natural philosophy, astronomy, and the methodology of science still evoke debate after over 360 years. His role in promoting the Copernican theory and his... Peter Machamer Thu, 13 Jun 2013 16:55:48 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/galileo/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/hartley/ [Revised entry by Richard Allen on June 13, 2013. Changes to: Bibliography] David Hartley (1705 - 57) is the author of Observations on Man, his Frame, his Duty, and his Expectations (1749) - a wide-ranging synthesis of neurology, moral psychology, and spirituality (i.e., our "frame," "duty," and "expectations"). The Observations gained dedicated advocates in Britain, America, and Continental Europe, who... Richard Allen Thu, 13 Jun 2013 16:37:16 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/hartley/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/collective-intentionality/ [New Entry by David P. Schweikard and Hans Bernhard Schmid on June 13, 2013.] Collective intentionality is the power of minds to be jointly directed at objects, matters of fact, states of affairs, goals, or values. Collective intentionality comes in a variety of modes, including shared intention, joint attention, shared belief, collective acceptance, and collective emotion. Collective intentional attitudes permeate our everyday lives, for instance when two or more agents look... David P. Schweikard and Hans Bernhard Schmid Thu, 13 Jun 2013 15:35:41 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/collective-intentionality/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/maimonides/ [Revised entry by Kenneth Seeskin on June 12, 2013. Changes to: Bibliography] Moses ben Maimon [known to English speaking audiences as Maimonides and Hebrew speaking as Rambam] (1138 - 1204) is the greatest Jewish philosopher of the medieval period and is still widely read today. The Mishneh Torah, his 14-volume compendium of Jewish law, established him as the leading rabbinic authority of his time and quite possibly of all time. His philosophic masterpiece, the Guide of the... Kenneth Seeskin Wed, 12 Jun 2013 17:25:44 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/maimonides/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/self-reference/ [Revised entry by Thomas Bolander on June 12, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] In the context of language, self-reference is used to denote a statement that refers to itself or its own referent. The most famous example of a self-referential sentence is the liar sentence: "This sentence is not true." Self-reference is often used... Thomas Bolander Wed, 12 Jun 2013 15:36:29 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/self-reference/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/personal-autonomy/ [Revised entry by Sarah Buss on June 10, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, notes.html] Autonomous agents are self-governing agents. But what is a self-governing agent? Governing oneself is no guarantee that one will have a greater range of options in the future, or the sort of opportunities one most wants to have. Since, moreover, a person can govern herself without being able to appreciate the difference between right and wrong, it seems that an autonomous agent can do something wrong without being to blame for her action. What, then, are the necessary and sufficient features of this self-relation? Philosophers have offered a wide range of competing answers to this question. 1. Introduction... Sarah Buss Mon, 10 Jun 2013 21:32:46 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/personal-autonomy/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/alcmaeon/ [Revised entry by Carl Huffman on June 10, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Alcmaeon of Croton was an early Greek medical writer and philosopher-scientist. His exact date, his relationship to other early Greek philosopher-scientists, and whether he was primarily a medical writer/physician or a typical Presocratic cosmologist, are all matters of controversy. He is likely to have written his book sometime between 500 and 450 BCE. The surviving fragments and testimonia focus primarily... Carl Huffman Mon, 10 Jun 2013 03:48:14 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/alcmaeon/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/location-mereology/ [New Entry by Cody Gilmore on June 7, 2013.] Substantivalists believe that there are regions of space or spacetime. Many substantivalists also believe that there are entities (people, tables, electrons, fields, holes, events, tropes, universals, ...) that are located at regions. For these philosophers, questions arise about the relationship between located entities and the regions at which they are located. Are located entities identical to their locations, as supersubstantivalists maintain? Are they entirely separate from their... Cody Gilmore Fri, 07 Jun 2013 22:49:50 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/location-mereology/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/medieval-literary/ [Revised entry by Eileen Sweeney on June 6, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Medieval philosophical texts are written in a variety of literary forms, many peculiar to the period, like the summa or disputed question; others, like the commentary, dialogue, and axiom, are also found in ancient and modern sources but are substantially different in the medieval period from their classical or modern instantiations of these forms. Many philosophical texts also have a highly polemical... Eileen Sweeney Thu, 06 Jun 2013 17:23:58 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/medieval-literary/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/life-meaning/ [Revised entry by Thaddeus Metz on June 3, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Many major historical figures in philosophy have provided an answer to the question of what, if anything, makes life meaningful, although they typically have not put it in these terms. Consider, for instance, Aristotle on the human function, Aquinas on the beatific vision, and Kant on the highest good. While these concepts have some bearing on happiness and morality, they are straightforwardly construed as... Thaddeus Metz Mon, 03 Jun 2013 22:05:13 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/life-meaning/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/confirmation/ [New Entry by Vincenzo Crupi on May 30, 2013.] Human cognition and behavior heavily relies on the notion that evidence (data, premises) can affect the credibility of hypotheses (theories, conclusions). This general idea seems to underlie sound and effective inferential practices in all sorts of domains, from everyday reasoning up to the frontiers of science. Yet it is also clear that, even with extensive and truthful evidence available, drawing a mistaken... Vincenzo Crupi Thu, 30 May 2013 19:47:36 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/confirmation/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/civic-education/ [Revised entry by Jack Crittenden and Peter Levine on May 30, 2013. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] In its broadest definition, "civic education" means all the processes that affect people's beliefs, commitments, capabilities, and actions as members or prospective members of communities. Civic education need not be intentional or deliberate; institutions and communities transmit values and norms without meaning to. It may not be beneficial: sometimes people are civically educated in ways that... Jack Crittenden and Peter Levine Thu, 30 May 2013 15:25:22 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/civic-education/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/emilie-du-chatelet/ [New Entry by Karen Detlefsen on May 29, 2013.] Emilie le Tonnelier de Breteuil, marquise Du Chatelet-Lomont - or simply Emilie Du Chatelet - was born in Paris on 17 December 1706 to baron Louis Nicholas le Tonnelier de Breteuil and Gabrielle Anne de Froullay, Baronne de Breteuil. She married Marquis Florent-Claude de Chatelet-Lomont in 1725. Together they had three children, a daughter and two sons... Karen Detlefsen Wed, 29 May 2013 16:20:49 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/emilie-du-chatelet/