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Thu, 02 Jul 2009 18:07:52 -0800 Thu, 02 Jul 2009 18:07:52 -0800 editors@plato.stanford.edu (Stanford Encyclopedia Editor) webmaster@plato.stanford.edu (Webmaster) http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/mathematical-style/ [New Entry by Paolo Mancosu on July 2, 2009.] The essay begins with a taxonomy of the major contexts in which the notion of 'style' in mathematics has been appealed to since the early twentieth century. These include the use of the notion of style in comparative cultural histories of mathematics, in characterizing national styles, and in describing mathematical practice. These developments are then related to the more familiar... Paolo Mancosu Thu, 02 Jul 2009 18:02:15 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/mathematical-style/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/truth-correspondence/ [Revised entry by Marian David on July 2, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Narrowly speaking, the correspondence theory of truth is the view that truth is correspondence to a fact - a view that was advocated by Russell and Moore early in the 20th century. But the label is usually applied much more broadly to any view explicitly embracing the idea that truth consists in a relation to reality, i.e., that truth is a relational property involving a characteristic relation (to... Marian David Thu, 02 Jul 2009 17:49:55 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/truth-correspondence/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ [Revised entry by James Garson on July 1, 2009. Changes to: Main text] A modal is an expression (like 'necessarily' or 'possibly') that is used to qualify the truth of a judgement. Modal logic is, strictly speaking, the study of the deductive behavior of the expressions 'it is necessary that' and 'it is possible that'. However, the term 'modal logic' may be used more broadly for a family of... James Garson Wed, 01 Jul 2009 17:09:17 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/fitch-paradox/ [Revised entry by Berit Brogaard and Joe Salerno on July 1, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] The paradox of knowability is a logical result suggesting that, necessarily, if all truths are knowable in principle then all truths are in fact known. The contrapositive of the result says, necessarily, if in fact there is an unknown truth, then there is a truth that couldn't possibly be known. More specifically, if p is a truth that is never known then it is unknowable that p is a truth that is never known. The proof has been... Berit Brogaard and Joe Salerno Wed, 01 Jul 2009 16:42:16 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/fitch-paradox/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spacetime-singularities/ [New Entry by Erik Curiel and Peter Bokulich on June 29, 2009.] A spacetime singularity is a breakdown in the geometrical structure of space and time. It is a topic of ongoing physical and philosophical research to clarify both the nature and significance of such pathologies. Because it is the fundamental geometry that is breaking down, spacetime singularities are often viewed as an end, or "edge," of spacetime itself. However, numerous difficulties arise when one tries... Erik Curiel and Peter Bokulich Mon, 29 Jun 2009 21:16:31 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spacetime-singularities/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/double-effect/ [Revised entry by Alison McIntyre on June 29, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] The doctrine (or principle) of double effect is often invoked to explain the permissibility of an action that causes a serious harm, such as the death of a human being, as a side effect of promoting some good end. It is claimed that sometimes it is permissible to cause such a harm as a side effect (or "double effect") of bringing about a good result even though it would not be permissible to cause... Alison McIntyre Mon, 29 Jun 2009 20:47:23 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/double-effect/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/davidson/ [Revised entry by Jeff Malpas on June 29, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Donald Davidson was one of the most important philosophers of the latter half of the twentieth century and with a reception and influence that, of American philosophers, is perhaps matched only by that of W. V. O. Quine. Davidson's ideas, presented in a series of essays (and one posthumous monograph) from the 1960s onwards, have had an impact in a range of areas from semantic theory through to... Jeff Malpas Mon, 29 Jun 2009 16:58:34 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/davidson/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/descartes-physics/ [Revised entry by Edward Slowik on June 27, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] While Rene Descartes (1596 - 1650) is well-known as one of the founders of modern philosophy, his influential role in the development of modern physics has been, until the later half of the twentieth century, generally under-appreciated and under-investigated by both historians and philosophers of science. Not only did Descartes provide the first distinctly modern formulation of laws of nature and a... Edward Slowik Sat, 27 Jun 2009 19:05:27 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/descartes-physics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/wright/ [Revised entry by Jean De Groot on June 27, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, notes.html] Chauncey Wright was an American philosopher of science of the second half of the nineteenth century and an early proponent of Darwinism in the United States. Sometimes cited as a founder of pragmatism, he is more appropriately remembered as an incisive and original philosophical thinker in the tradition of British empiricism.[1]... Jean De Groot Sat, 27 Jun 2009 18:49:35 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/wright/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/insolubles/ [Revised entry by Paul Vincent Spade and Stephen Read on June 26, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources, notes.html] The medieval name for paradoxes like the famous Liar Paradox ("This proposition is false") was "insolubles" or insolubilia.[1] From the late-twelfth century to the end of the Middle Ages and beyond, such paradoxes were discussed at length by an enormous number of authors. Yet, unlike twentieth century interest... Paul Vincent Spade and Stephen Read Fri, 26 Jun 2009 19:17:28 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/insolubles/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aesthetics-existentialist/ [New Entry by Jean-Philippe Deranty on June 26, 2009.] Many of the philosophers commonly described as "existentialist" have made original and decisive contributions to aesthetic thinking. In most cases, a substantial involvement in artistic practice (as novelists, playwrights or musicians) nourished their thinking on aesthetic experience. This is true already of two of the major philosophers who inspired... Jean-Philippe Deranty Fri, 26 Jun 2009 16:30:04 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aesthetics-existentialist/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/horkheimer/ [New Entry by J.C. Berendzen on June 24, 2009.] Max Horkheimer (1895 - 1973) was a leader of the so-called "Frankfurt School," a group of philosophers and social scientists associated with the Institut fur Sozialforschung (Institute of Social Research) in Frankfurt am Main. Horkheimer was the director of the Institute and Professor of Social Philosophy at the University of Frankfurt from 1930 - 1933, and again from... J.C. Berendzen Wed, 24 Jun 2009 15:47:03 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/horkheimer/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/technology/ [Revised entry by Maarten Franssen, Gert-Jan Lokhorst, and Ibo van de Poel on June 22, 2009. Changes to: Main text] If philosophy is the attempt "to understand how things in the broadest possible sense of the term hang together in the broadest possible sense of the term", as Sellars (1962) put it, philosophy should not ignore technology. It is largely by technology that contemporary society hangs together. It is hugely important not only as an economic force but also as a cultural force. During the last two centuries, much philosophy of technology has been concerned with the impact of technology on society. Mitcham (1994) calls this... Maarten Franssen, Gert-Jan Lokhorst, and Ibo van de Poel Mon, 22 Jun 2009 18:34:04 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/technology/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logical-form/ [Revised entry by Paul Pietroski on June 22, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Some inferences are impeccable. Examples like (1 - 3) illustrate reasoning that cannot lead from true premises to false conclusions.... Paul Pietroski Mon, 22 Jun 2009 02:52:26 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logical-form/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/folkpsych-simulation/ [Revised entry by Robert M. Gordon on June 22, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] The simulation (or, "mental simulation") theory (ST) is a theory of everyday human psychological competence: that is, of the skills and resources people routinely call on in the anticipation, explanation, and social coordination of behavior. ST holds that we represent the mental states and processes of others by mentally simulating them, or generating similar states and processes in ourselves: thus, for... Robert M. Gordon Mon, 22 Jun 2009 01:24:42 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/folkpsych-simulation/