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Sat, 07 Nov 2009 22:18:26 -0800 Sat, 07 Nov 2009 22:18:26 -0800 editors@plato.stanford.edu (Stanford Encyclopedia Editor) webmaster@plato.stanford.edu (Webmaster) http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/socrates/ [Revised entry by Debra Nails on November 7, 2009. Changes to: Main text, notes.html, supplement.html] Constantin Brancusi. Socrates... Debra Nails Sat, 07 Nov 2009 22:10:29 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/socrates/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/identity/ [Revised entry by Harold Noonan on November 7, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] Much of the debate about identity in recent decades has been about personal identity, and specifically about personal identity over time, but identity generally, and the identity of things of other kinds, have also attracted attention. Various interrelated problems have been at the centre of discussion, but it is fair to say that recent work has focussed particularly on the following areas: the notion of a criterion... Harold Noonan Sat, 07 Nov 2009 21:51:16 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/identity/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/telesio/ [Revised entry by Michaela Boenke on November 4, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] Bernardino Telesio (1509 - 1588) belongs to a group of independent philosophers of the late Renaissance who left the universities in order to develop philosophical and scientific ideas beyond the restrictions of the Aristotelian-scholastic tradition. Authors in the early modern period referred to these philosophers as 'novateurs' and 'modern'. In contrast to his successors Patrizzi and Campanella,... Michaela Boenke Wed, 04 Nov 2009 15:04:35 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/telesio/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spacetime-iframes/ [Revised entry by Robert DiSalle on November 4, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] A "frame of reference" is a standard relative to which motion and rest may be measured; any set of points or objects that are at rest relative to one another enables us, in principle, to describe the relative motions of bodies. A frame of reference is therefore a purely kinematical device, for the geometrical description of motion without regard to the masses or forces involved. A dynamical account of... Robert DiSalle Wed, 04 Nov 2009 14:43:51 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/spacetime-iframes/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/ryle/ [Revised entry by Julia Tanney on November 2, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Although Gilbert Ryle published on a wide range of topics in philosophy (notably in the history of philosophy and in philosophy of language), including a series of lectures centred on philosophical dilemmas, a series of articles on the concept of thinking, and a book on Plato, The Concept of Mind remains his best known and most important work. Through this work, Ryle is thought to have... Julia Tanney Mon, 02 Nov 2009 15:27:15 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/ryle/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-classical/ [Revised entry by Stewart Shapiro on November 2, 2009. Changes to: Main text] Typically, a logic consists of a formal or informal language together with a deductive system and/or a model-theoretic semantics. The language is, or corresponds to, a part of a natural language like English or Greek. The deductive system is to capture, codify, or simply record which inferences are correct for the given language, and the semantics is to capture, codify, or record the... Stewart Shapiro Mon, 02 Nov 2009 00:55:46 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-classical/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logical-atomism/ [Revised entry by Kevin Klement on October 30, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] Bertrand Russell (1872 - 1970) described his philosophy as a kind of "logical atomism", by which he meant to endorse both a metaphysical view and a certain methodology for doing philosophy. The metaphysical view amounts to the claim that the world consists of a plurality of independently existing things exhibiting qualities and standing in relations. According to logical atomism, all truths are ultimately... Kevin Klement Fri, 30 Oct 2009 15:21:30 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logical-atomism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/monotheism/ [Revised entry by William Wainwright on October 26, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] Theists believe that reality's ultimate principle is God - an omnipotent, omniscient, goodness that is the creative ground of everything other than itself. Monotheism is the view that there is only one such God. After a brief discussion of monotheism's historical origins, this entry looks at the five most influential attempts to establish God's uniqueness. We will consider arguments from God's... William Wainwright Mon, 26 Oct 2009 18:32:06 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/monotheism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/james/ [Revised entry by Russell Goodman on October 23, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources] William James was an original thinker in and between the disciplines of physiology, psychology and philosophy. His twelve-hundred page masterwork, The Principles of Psychology (1890), is a rich blend of physiology, psychology, philosophy, and personal reflection that has given us such ideas as "the stream of thought" and the baby's impression of the world "as one great blooming, buzzing confusion" (PP... Russell Goodman Fri, 23 Oct 2009 14:26:29 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/james/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/althusser/ [New Entry by William Lewis on October 16, 2009.] Louis Pierre Althusser (1918 - 1990) was one of the most influential Marxist philosophers of the 20th Century. As they seemed to offer a renewal of Marxist thought as well as to render Marxism philosophically respectable, the claims he advanced in the 1960s about Marxist philosophy were discussed and debated worldwide. Due to apparent reversals in his theoretical positions, to the ill-fated facts... William Lewis Fri, 16 Oct 2009 16:06:23 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/althusser/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/margaret-cavendish/ [New Entry by David Cunning on October 16, 2009.] Margaret Lucas Cavendish was a philosopher, poet, scientist, fiction-writer, and playwright who lived in the Seventeenth Century. Her work is important for a number of reasons. One is that it lays out an early and very compelling version of the naturalism that is found in current-day philosophy and science. It also offers important insights that bear on recent discussions of the nature and characteristics of intelligence and the question of whether or not the bodies that surround us are intelligent or have an intelligent... David Cunning Fri, 16 Oct 2009 15:55:28 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/margaret-cavendish/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/compatibilism/ [Revised entry by Michael McKenna on October 5, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources, notes.html, supplement.html] Compatibilism offers a solution to the free will problem. This philosophical problem concerns a disputed incompatibility between free will and determinism. Compatibilism is the thesis that free will is compatible with determinism. Because free will is typically taken to be a necessary condition of moral responsibility, compatibilism is sometimes expressed in terms of a compatibility... Michael McKenna Mon, 05 Oct 2009 22:00:55 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/compatibilism/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ [Revised entry by James Garson on October 2, 2009. Changes to: Bibliography] A modal is an expression (like 'necessarily' or 'possibly') that is used to qualify the truth of a judgement. Modal logic is, strictly speaking, the study of the deductive behavior of the expressions 'it is necessary that' and 'it is possible that'. However, the term 'modal logic' may be used more broadly for a family of... James Garson Fri, 02 Oct 2009 18:15:33 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/thoreau/ [Revised entry by Rick Anthony Furtak on October 2, 2009. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Henry David Thoreau (1817 - 1862) was an American philosopher, poet, and environmental scientist whose major work, Walden, draws upon each of these identities in meditating on the concrete problems of living in the world as a human being. He sought to revive a conception of philosophy as a way of life, not only a mode of reflective thought and discourse. Thoreau's work was informed by an eclectic variety of... Rick Anthony Furtak Fri, 02 Oct 2009 18:04:44 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/thoreau/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/neo-taoism/ [New Entry by Alan Chan on October 1, 2009.] "Neo-Daoism" (or "Neo-Taoism" in the "Wade-Giles" system of romanization) names the focal development in early "medieval" Chinese philosophy, from the third to the sixth century C.E. In Chinese sources, this development is called xuanxue (hsuan-hsueh, in Wade-Giles), literally the "learning" or study (xue) of the "dark" or mysterious and profound... Alan Chan Thu, 01 Oct 2009 20:38:03 -0800 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/neo-taoism/