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Wed, 14 May 2008 16:11:25 -0700 Wed, 14 May 2008 16:11:25 -0700 editors@plato.stanford.edu webmaster@plato.stanford.edu http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/weakness-will/ [New Entry by Sarah Stroud on May 14, 2008.] Julie chose b over a, even though she knew b was more expensive than a. There is nothing puzzling about Julie's choice. Perhaps Julie was... Sarah Stroud Wed, 14 May 2008 16:09:45 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/weakness-will/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ [Revised entry by James Garson on May 13, 2008. Changes to: Main text] A modal is an expression (like 'necessarily' or 'possibly') that is used to qualify the truth of a judgement. Modal logic is, strictly speaking, the study of the deductive behavior of the expressions 'it is necessary that' and 'it is possible that'. However, the term 'modal logic' may be used more broadly for a family of... James Garson Tue, 13 May 2008 21:50:19 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-modal/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/turing-test/ [Revised entry by Graham Oppy and David Dowe on May 13, 2008. Changes to: Bibliography] The phrase "The Turing Test" is most properly used to refer to a proposal made by Turing (1950) as a way of dealing with the question whether machines can think. According to Turing, the question whether machines can think is itself "too meaningless" to deserve discussion (442). However, if we consider the more precise - and somehow related - question whether a digital computer... Graham Oppy and David Dowe Tue, 13 May 2008 17:00:51 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/turing-test/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/feminism-gender/ [New Entry by Mari Mikkola on May 12, 2008.] Feminism is said to be the movement to end women's oppression (hooks 2000, 26). One possible way to understand 'woman' in this claim is to take it as a sex term: 'woman' picks out human females and being a human female depends on various biological and anatomical features (like genitalia). Historically many feminists have understood 'woman' differently: not as a sex term, but as... Mari Mikkola Mon, 12 May 2008 14:08:05 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/feminism-gender/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-ai/ [Revised entry by Richmond Thomason on May 9, 2008. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography, Internet resources, notes.html] Artificial Intelligence (which I'll refer to hereafter by its nickname, "AI") is the subfield of Computer Science devoted to developing programs that enable computers to display behavior that can (broadly) be characterized as intelligent.[1] Most research in AI is devoted to fairly narrow applications, such as planning or speech-to-speech... Richmond Thomason Fri, 09 May 2008 12:36:23 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logic-ai/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/sidney-hook/ [New Entry by David Sidorsky on May 8, 2008.] The philosophical career of Sidney Hook was characterized by the length and constancy of his commitment to the philosophy of John Dewey. Hook was a leading interpreter and proponent of Deweyan pragmatic naturalism from his years as Dewey's graduate student at Columbia in the 1920s through the six decades of his philosophical teaching and writing until his death in 1989. He identified with the attribution... David Sidorsky Thu, 08 May 2008 20:40:35 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/sidney-hook/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/croce-aesthetics/ [New Entry by Gary Kemp on May 4, 2008.] The Neapolitan Benedetto Croce (1860 - 1952) was a dominant figure in the first half of the twentieth century in aesthetics and literary criticism as well as philosophy generally, but his fame did not last, in either Italy or the English speaking world. He did not lack promulgators and willing translators into English; H. Carr was an early example of the former, R. G. Collingwood was both, and... Gary Kemp Sun, 04 May 2008 16:06:00 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/croce-aesthetics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/situations-semantics/ [Revised entry by Angelika Kratzer on April 30, 2008. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography Changes to: Bibliography] Situation semantics was developed as an alternative to possible worlds semantics. In situation semantics, linguistic expressions are evaluated with respect to partial, rather than complete, worlds. There is no consensus about what situations are, just as there is no consensus about what possible worlds or events are. According to some, situations are structured entities consisting of relations and... Angelika Kratzer Wed, 30 Apr 2008 16:59:26 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/situations-semantics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/essential-accidental/ [New Entry by Teresa Robertson on April 29, 2008.] The distinction between essential versus accidental properties has been characterized in various ways, but it is currently most commonly understood in modal terms along these lines: an essential property of an object is a property that it must have while an accidental property of an object is one that it happens to have but that it could lack. Let's call this the basic... Teresa Robertson Tue, 29 Apr 2008 16:10:44 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/essential-accidental/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/alcmaeon/ [Revised entry by Carl Huffman on April 28, 2008. Changes to: Main text, Bibliography] Alcmaeon of Croton was an early Greek medical writer and philosopher-scientist. His exact date, his relationship to other early Greek philosopher-scientists, and whether he was primarily a medical writer/physician or a typical Presocratic cosmologist, are all matters of controversy. He is likely to have written his book sometime between 500 and 450 BC. The surviving fragments and testimonia focus primarily... Carl Huffman Mon, 28 Apr 2008 16:32:55 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/alcmaeon/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/stem-cells/ [New Entry by Andrew Siegel on April 25, 2008.] Human embryonic stem cell (HESC) research offers much hope for alleviating the human suffering brought on by the ravages of disease and injury. HESCs are characterized by their capacity for self-renewal and their ability to differentiate into all types of cells of the body. The main goal of HESC research is to identify the mechanisms that govern cell differentiation and to turn HESCs into... Andrew Siegel Fri, 25 Apr 2008 06:18:43 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/stem-cells/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/fictionalism-mathematics/ [New Entry by Mark Balaguer on April 22, 2008.] Mathematical fictionalism (or as I'll call it, fictionalism) is best thought of as a reaction to mathematical platonism. Platonism is the view that (a) there exist abstract mathematical objects (i.e., nonspatiotemporal mathematical objects), and (b) our mathematical sentences and theories provide true descriptions of such objects. So, for instance, on the platonist... Mark Balaguer Tue, 22 Apr 2008 20:28:58 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/fictionalism-mathematics/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/ikhwan-al-safa/ [New Entry by Carmela Baffioni on April 22, 2008.] The Ikhwan al-Safa' or "Brethren of Purity", as their name is commonly translated, are the authors of one of the most complete Medieval encyclopaedias of sciences, antecedent at least two centuries to the best known in the Latin world (by Alexander Neckham, Thomas de Cantimpre, Vincent de Beauvais, Bartholomaeus Anglicus, all dating back to the 13th... Carmela Baffioni Tue, 22 Apr 2008 20:04:49 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/ikhwan-al-safa/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/dedekind-foundations/ [New Entry by Erich Reck on April 22, 2008.] It is widely acknowledged that Richard Dedekind (1831 - 1916) was one of the greatest mathematicians of the nineteenth-century, as well as one of the most important contributors to number theory and algebra of all time. Any comprehensive history of mathematics will mention him for, among others: his invention of the theory of ideals and his investigation of the notions of algebraic number, field, module,... Erich Reck Tue, 22 Apr 2008 05:58:23 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/dedekind-foundations/ http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-causality/ [Revised entry by Andrea Falcon on April 22, 2008. Changes to: Bibliography] Each Aristotelian science consists in the causal investigation of a specific department of reality. If successful, such an investigation results in causal knowledge; that is, knowledge of the relevant or appropriate causes. The emphasis on the concept of cause explains why Aristotle developed a theory of causality which is commonly known as the doctrine of the four causes. For Aristotle, a firm grasp of what a... Andrea Falcon Tue, 22 Apr 2008 04:19:42 -0700 http://plato.stanford.edu/entries/aristotle-causality/