Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Epistemic Utility Arguments for Probabilism

Proof of Theorem 5

We wish to prove the following theorem (Leitgeb and Pettigrew 2010a):

Theorem 5. Local and Global Comparability and Agreement on Urgency entail

  1. L(A, v, r) = λ|v(A) − r
  2. G(b, v) = λΣ|v(vi) − b(vi)|², where again v1, …, vn are the atoms of F.

Suppose Local and Global Comparability and Agreement on Urgency. By Local and Global Comparability, there is a strictly increasing function f : ℜ → ℜ such that f(0) = 0 and

L(A, v, r) = f(|v(A) − r|) and G(b, v) = f(||bv||)

It follows that there is a strictly increasing function g : ℜ → ℜ such that g(0) = 0 and

L(A, v, r) = g(|v(A) − r|²) and G(b, v) = g(||bv||²)

To prove the theorem, it suffices to show that there is λ > 0 such that g(x) = λx, for all x ≥ 0. For, if this is true, then

  1. L(A, v, r) = λ|v(A) − r
  2. G(b, v) = λ||bv||².

as required.

To prove this, it suffices to show that g′ is constant and positive on the non-negative reals. We prove this in two stages:

  1. First, we show that g′(1 + x) = g′(1), for x ≥ 0.
  2. Second, we show that g′(x) = g′(x + 1), for x ≥ 0.

From this, we infer that g′(x) = g′(1), for all x ≥ 0. That is, g′ is constant. Since g is strictly increasing, we know that g′ must be a positive constant, as required.

To prove that g′(1 + x) = g′(1), for x ≥ 0, we take a ≥ 0 and let b′(v2) = √a, and b′(v3) = … = b′(vn) = 0.

Then we have

LUrgL, W(x, v1 | b)
  =  d/dx LExpL, W(x, v1 | b)
  =  d/dx Σb(v)L(v1, v, x)
  =  d/dx [b(v1)g((1 − x)²) + b(v2)g(x²) + … + b(vn)g(x²)]
  =  −2(1 − x)b(v1)g′((1 − x)²) + 2xb(v2)g′(x²) + … + 2xb(vn)g′(x²)

Thus, LUrgL, W(0, v1 | b) = −2b(v1)g′(1).

And we also have

GUrgG, W(b′, x, v1 | b)
  =  d/dx Σb(v)G(v, b′(x / v1))
  =  d/dx Σb(v)g(||b′(x / v1v||²)
  =  d/dx [b(v1)g((1 − x)² + a) + b(v2)g(x² + (1 − √a)²) + b(v3)g(x² + a + 1) + … + b(vn)g(x² + a + 1)]
  =  −2(1−x)b(v1)g′((1 − x)² + a) + 2xb(v2)g′(x² + (1 − √a)²) + 2xb(v3)g(x² + a + 1) + … + 2xb(vn)g′(x² + a + 1)

Thus, GUrgG, W(b′, 0, v1 | b) = −2b(v1)g′(1 + a). Thus, by Agreement on urgency, we have g′(1 + a) = g′(1), for all a ≥ 0, as required.

To prove that g′(x) = g′(x + 1), for x ≥ 0, we take a ≥ 0, and let b(v1) = b(v3) = … = b(vn) = 0 and b(v2) = 1 and b′(v2) = b′(v3) = … = b′(vn) = 0.

Then we have

LUrgL, W(x, v1 | b)
  =  d/dx g((v2(v1) − x)²)
  =  d/dx g(x²)
  =  2xg′(x²)

and

GUrgG, W(b′, x, v1 | b)
  =  d/dx g(||v2ˆ − b′(x / v1)ˆ||²)
  =  d/dx g(x² + 1)
  =  2xg′(x² + 1).

Thus, by Agreement on urgency, we have g′(x²) = g′(x² + 1), as required.

This completes our proof.