Proof of Theorem 6

We wish to prove the following theorem (Selten 1984):

Theorem 6. Perspective Indifference, World Indifference, and Weakly Non-Trivial entail

G(p, v) = λΣ|v(v_i) − p(v_i)|²

for all p in P and v in V, where v₁, …, v_n are the atoms of F.

First, by World Indifference, every world v is exactly the same distance from every other world v′. Thus, let G(v, v′) = c, for all v ≠ v′. Now suppose p ∈ P and v_i ∈ V. Then, by Perspective Indifference,

GExp_G(p | p) − GExp_G(v_i | p) = GExp_G(v_i | v_i) − GExp_G(p | v_i)

That is, p is the same distance from v_i as v_i is from p, where the distance of one probability function from another is given by the expected inaccuracy of the first by the lights of the second corrected so that every probability function is at distance 0 from itself.

Spelling out the definition of GExp_G we derive

GExp_G(p | p) − Σp(v)G(v_i, v) = Σv_i(v)G(v_i, v) − Σv_i(v)G(p, v)

Thus, by World Indifference, we have

GExp_G(p | p) − c(1 − p(v_i)) = -G(p, v_i)

which gives

G(p | v_i) = c − cp(v_i) − GExp_G(p | p)

From this point on, we are simply manipulating formulae: there is no deep explanation for what is going on. Substituting this into the definition of GExp_G, we have

GExpG(p | p)
=	Σp(v)[c − cp(v) − GExpG(p | p)]
=	c − GExpG(p | p) − cΣp(v)²

So

GExp_G = ½c − ½cΣp(v)²

Substituting this into the expression for G given above, we have

G(p, vi)
=	c − cp(vi) − ½c + ½cΣp(v)²
=	½c − ½c[2p(vi) − Σp(v)²]
=	½c||p − vi||².

as required.