Proof of Theorems 8 and 9

We wish to prove the following theorems (Leitgeb and Pettigrew 2010b):

Theorem 8. Suppose L(A, v, r) = λ|v(A) − r|². Suppose b ∈ B and E ∈ F. Then the following are equivalent:

1. For all A in F and r in ℜ,

   LExp_{L, E}(b(A), A | b) ≤ LExp_{L, E}(r, A | b)

2. b is a probability function on F and b(E) = 1.

That is, only probabilistic credence functions that assign credence 1 to E expect themselves to be at least as good as they expect any other credence function to be in the light of evidence E.

Theorem 9. Suppose L(A, v, r) = λ|v(A) − r|². Suppose b, b′ in B are probability functions, E in F, and b(E) > 0. Then the following are equivalent:

1. For all A in F and r in ℜ,

   LExp_{L, E}(b′(A), A | b) ≤ LExp_{L, E}(r, A | b)

2. b′(•) = b( • | E).

That is, an initial probabilistic credence function b expects conditionalization to give the best credence function in the presence of evidence E.

We prove these two theorems together because they both depend on the following lemma. We use Σ_A to denote the sum over those v in V that make proposition A true. And we use Σ to denote the sum over all v in V.

Lemma 1. Suppose L(A, v, r) = λ|v(A) − r|², b ∈ B and b(v) > 0 for some v such that v(E) = 1. Then the following two propositions are equivalent:

1. d/dx LExp_{L, E}(x, A | b) = 0
2. x = [Σ_A&Eb(v)] / [Σ_Eb(v)]

The proof is straightforward calculus:

d/dx LExpL, E(x, A b)
=	d/dx[ΣA&E b(v)(1 − x)² + Σ¬A&Eb(v)x²]
=	2xΣEb(v) − 2ΣA&Eb(v)
=	0

if, and only if,

x = [Σ_A&Eb(v)] / Σ_Eb(v)

From this lemma, Theorems 8 and 9 follow.

By Lemma 1, Theorem 8(1) holds if, and only if,

b(A) = [Σ_A&Eb(v)] / [Σ_Eb(v)]

which can easily be verified to hold if, and only if, b is a probability function on F with b(E) = 1. That is, if, and only if, Theorem 8(2) holds.

Similarly, by Lemma 1, Theorem 9(1) holds if, and only if,

b’(A) = [Σ_A&Eb(v)] / [Σ_Eb(v)]

for all A in F, which holds if, and only if, b’(A) = b(A | E) for all A in F. That is, if, and only if, Theorem 9(2) holds.