Supplement to Common Knowledge
Proof of Proposition 3.1
Proposition 3.1.Let Ω be a finite set of states of the world. Suppose that
- Agents i and j have a common prior probability distribution μ(·) over the events of Ω such that μ(ω) > 0 for each ω ∈ Ω, and
- It is common knowledge at ω that i's posterior probability of event E is qi(E) and that j's posterior probability of E is qj(E).
Then qi(E) = qj(E).
Proof.
Let
M
be the meet of all the
agents' partitions, and let
M(
ω) be the element of
M
containing ω. Since
M(
ω) consists of cells common to every
agents information partition, we can write
M(ω) = ∪k Hik,
where each Hik ∈ Hi. Since i's posterior probability of event E is common knowledge, it is constant on M(ω), and so
qi(E) = μ(E | Hik) for all k
Hence,
μ( E ∩ Hik) = qi(E) μ(Hik)
and so
μ(E ∩ M(ω)) =
μ(E ∩ ∪k Hik) =
μ(∪kE ∩ Hik) = Σk μ(E ∩ Hik) = Σk qi(E) μ(Hik) = qi(E)Σk μ(Hik) = qi(E) μ(∪k Hik) = qi(E) μ(M(ω))
Applying the same argument to j, we have
μ(E ∩ M(ω)) = qj(E) μ(M(ω))
so we must have qi(E) = qj(E). □
Copyright © 2007 by
Peter Vanderschraaf <pvanderschraaf@gmail.com>
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@sas.upenn.edu>
Peter Vanderschraaf <pvanderschraaf@gmail.com>
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@sas.upenn.edu>