Egalitarianism
Egalitarianism is a trend of thought in political philosophy. An egalitarian favors equality of some sort: People should get the same, or be treated the same, or be treated as equals, in some respect. Egalitarian doctrines tend to express the idea that all human persons are equal in fundamental worth or moral status. So far as the Western European and Anglo-American philosophical tradition is concerned, one significant source of this thought is the Christian notion that God loves all human souls equally. Egalitarianism is a protean doctrine, because there are several different types of equality, or ways in which people might be treated the same, that might be thought desirable. In modern democratic societies, the term "egalitarian" is often used to refer to a position that favors, for any of a wide array of reasons, a greater degree of equality of income and wealth across persons than currently exists.
- 1. Preliminary Distinctions
- 2. Equality of Opportunity
- 3. Equality of Condition: Equality of What?
- 4. Equality among Whom?
- 5. Is Equality Desirable Per Se? Varieties of Egalitarianism
- Bibliography
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. Preliminary Distinctions
Egalitarianism is a contested concept in social and political thought. One might care about human equality in many ways, for many reasons. As currently used, the label "egalitarian" does not necessarily indicate that the doctrine so called holds that it is desirable that people's condition be made the same in any respect or that people ought to be treated the same in any respect. An egalitarian might rather be one who maintains that people ought to be treated as equals--as possessing equal fundamental worth and dignity and as equally morally considerable. In this sense, a sample nonegalitarian would be one who believes that people born into a higher social caste, or a favored race or ethnicity, or with an above-average stock of traits deemed desirable, ought somehow to count for more than others in calculations that determine what morally ought to be done. (On the thought that the core egalitarian ideal is treating people as equals, see Dworkin 2000.) Further norms of equality of condition or treatment might be viewed as free-standing or derived from the claim of equality of status. Controversy also swirls around attempts to specify the class of human persons to whom egalitarian norms apply. Some might count an unborn fetus or a very severely demented human as persons; others disagree.
Egalitarianism can be instrumental or noninstrumental. Given a specification of some aspect of people's condition or mode of treating them that should be equal, one might hold that the state of affairs in which the stated equality obtains is morally valuable either as an end or as a means. The instrumental egalitarian values equality as a means to some independently specifiable goal; the noninstrumental egalitarian values equality for its own sake--as an end, or as partly constitutive of some end. For example, someone who believes that the maintenance of equality across a group of people fosters relations of solidarity and community among them, and is desirable for that reason, qualifies as an instrumental egalitarian. Someone who believes that equality of some sort is a component of justice, and morally required as such, would be a noninstrumental egalitarian.
Equality of any sort might be valued conditionally or unconditionally. One values equality in the former way if equality is deemed valuable only if some further condition is in place. One might hold that equality in the distribution of resources among a group of persons is valuable, but only on the condition that the individuals are equally deserving.
Equality might be deemed to be desirable or undesirable. A separate and distinct range of questions concerns whether or not people ought to act to bring about equality or are obligated to bring about equality (see Nagel 1991). The discussion to come often merges these questions, the assumption being that if equality is valuable, that is at least one good reason for thinking one should bring it about.
Egalitarianism can be formulated with a variety of roles in mind. For example, an egalitarian norm might be proposed as a fundamental moral principle. As such, it would be intended as a statement of the ultimate norm (or as a member of the set of ultimate norms) to which individual conduct and institutional arrangements ought to conform. An ultimate norm might or might not be suitable for the role of guiding individual decision making or of serving as an explicitly recognized principle regulating institutions and public policy formation in a particular society. If individual agents and public officials are liable through limited cognitive ability, limited knowledge, or limited allegiance to morality to misapply ultimate principles, it might well be the case that these principles could be implemented to a greater degree if they were not employed directly as decisionmaking guides for individual and public policy choice. (On this issue, see Hare 1981). Following this train of thought, one might favor as guidelines for individual and public choice simple, easily understood, readily implementable rules that are to serve as proxies for the moral principles that are the ultimate norms. Or one might instead hold that the ultimate moral principles that fix what is right and wrong are well suited to be practical decision making guides. The point is merely that we should distinguish these distinct roles that moral norms might play and avoid criticizing a norm in one role by standards appropriate only if the norm is understood to be playing a different role.
Given some specification of the kind of equality that is under consideration, it is clear what it means to say of a number of people that they are equal in the stated respect. If we are concerned with equal utility, then a group has equal utility when all have exactly the same. If we are concerned with equality of dollar holdings, then people are equal when all hold exactly the same number of dollars. But saying that much does not yet suggest a way of determining, in general, whether inequality is greater in one situation than in another, when different people hold different amounts of the good that we are concerned to equalize in the two situations. Inequality can be measured in different ways, and no measure seems to be strongly supported by common sense intuition about the meaning of equality. (See Sen 1997 and Temkin 1993 ). This entry usually abstracts from this issue by supposing that we can unequivocally determine, for any ideal of equality, how to measure degrees of inequality across the board.
2. Equality of Opportunity
In a hierarchical caste society, positions of advantage are assigned to people on a basis of birth lineage. If one is a legitimate offspring of parents who are aristocrats, one will also enjoy the privileges of aristocratic rank. An historically important form of equality associated with the rise of competitive market economies is the ideal of equality of opportunity. This ideal is also known as formal equality of opportunity or careers open to talents.
Equality of opportunity requires that jobs in economic firms and options to borrow money for investment purposes such as starting a business should be open to all applicants, that applications be assessed by relevant criteria of merit, and that the top-ranked applicant should be offered the job or option to borrow. The relevant criteria of merit are to be set so that those who score highest are those whose selection would best further the morally innocent purposes of the enterprise. In competitive market settings, the presumption typically is that the criteria should be related to profitability. The best applicant for a job or a loan would then be the individual to whom offering the good in question produces the greatest increase in the firm's expected profit. (If the firm's owners are risk averse or risk seeking, the pertinent criterion would be expected profit weighted by their risk preferences.) A further aspect of the ideal of equality of opportunity requires that economic firms offering goods and services for sale should sell to all willing customers, treating all potential customers evenhandedly as potential sources of profit. Finally, equality of opportunity requires that purchasers of goods and services should be responsive only to the price and quality of the goods offered to them for purchase (and not, for example, to the ethnicity or sex or sexual orientation of the maker or seller of the good). This last-mentioned requirement of equality of opportunity is not included within formulations of the norm that are intended to be enacted as law and enforced by criminal or civil law procedures. But to implement equality of opportunity, an orientation of the hearts and minds of members of society is needed, not merely legal enactments. Equality of opportunity would be subverted if the laws effectively prohibited economic firms from basing decision making on factors other than expected profitability but consumers would not purchase products that embodied the skilled labor of women and blacks, so that their market opportunities are stunted.
Two natural extensions of the equality of opportunity ideal deserve mention. One is the requirement that places in colleges and universities and competitive private schools should be open to all applicants with applicants ranked by their ability to learn and other academic virtues and selected on these academic grounds (provided they can pay the tuition and fees). A second extension requires that public sector jobs--other than those reserved for elected officials along with their staffs--should be open to all applicants with selection of applicants being made on the basis of the merits of the applications.
The general idea of equality of opportunity is that the political economy of a society distributes positions that confer special advantages and these should be open to all applicants with applicants selected by merit. The merits of the applications for a position should track the degree to which the applicant's hiring or selection for interaction would boost the fulfillment of the morally innocent purposes of the association as weighted by the association's bosses. The more general formulation of the notion of merit allows that an economic firm might legitimately base its decisions on nonmarket values without engaging in wrongful discrimination that violates equality of opportunity rightly construed. For example, a maker of fancy surfboards might sell them by preference to more skilled surfers, and a mountaineering guide might select clients partly on the basis of their physical fitness and their perceived enthusiasm for wilderness adventure. Also, members of the learned professions such as medicine and law might be bound by legal and cultural norms that require them to tailor their services to the aims of the profession rather than just to profitability (e.g., norms that require a medical doctor to refuse to provide a medical treatment to a potential client who is willing and able to pay but would not benefit from the treatment).
The ideal of equality of opportunity is the ideal of a political economy in which each person's prospects as producer depend only on his initial stock of resources plus his ability and willingness to provide goods and services that others value plus luck as market fluctuations are encountered. Moreover, in the role of consumer, each individual (modulo his location) faces the same array of goods and services on sale to anyone who can pay the purchase price (and can satisfy the relevant nonmarket conditions of the seller or maker). Such characteristics of persons as their supposed race, skin color, ethnicity, sex, sexual orientation, and religion play no role in determining one's life prospects in this public sphere except insofar as these traits might happen to affect one's abilities and willingness to offer what others are willing to exchange for money.
In theory, equality of opportunity could be fully satisfied in a society in which wealth passed along by inheritance from generation to generation fundamentally determines everyone's competitive prospects. In this society jobs and positions and so on would be open to all applicants, but the only applicants who have the skills that qualify them for desirable posts are the children of the wealthy. They alone have access to the training and acculturation that confer skills.
A society that establishes and maintains a state educational system sustained by public funds already goes some way beyond equality of opportunity and toward provision to all of its members of some opportunity to develop skills that will enable them to succeed in competitions for desirable positions regulated by equality of opportunity. The same can be said of a society that enforces minimal standards of child raising to which parents must conform. One can imagine a society doing more in this same spirit.
A society might institute policies that secure at least a minimally acceptable threshold of schooling and skill formation for all its members. An alternative aim is to eliminate entirely the advantages that family wealth and social status confer on individuals in competitions regulated by formal equality of opportunity. The achievement of this aim would render a society classless, in a certain sense. John Rawls (Rawls, 1971 and 2001) has formulated this ideal as a principle of equality of fair opportunity (EFO). This principle holds that any individuals in society with the same native talent and ambition should have the same prospects of success in competition for positions that confer special benefits and advantages. EFO goes beyond equality of opportunity by requiring that all efforts by parents to give their children a comparative advantage in competitions for desirable positions and posts are somehow entirely offset. In a society regulated by EFO, socialization is adjusted so that among people equally willing to work to become qualified for a particular career and equally endowed by genetic inheritance with latent ability needed for that career, all have the same chances of success in that career.
EFO also opposes racial and sexual and similar prejudices that work to deprive disfavored individuals from enjoying opportunities to become qualified so that they would benefit from formal equality of opportunity. In some settings, affirmative action policies that aim to help members of historically disadvantaged groups such as African-Americans in the U.S. gain desirable employment opportunities in proportion to their numbers in the population can be regarded as policies intended to move society in the direction of satisfying EFO.
Formal equality of opportunity, in so far as it imposes requirements on firms, universities and colleges, and government as employer, is the law of the land in many modern democracies, and also entrenched in the common-sense morality most people embrace. By contrast, equality of fair opportunity is a controversial principle, which no existing nation seriously strives to achieve or comes close to achieving.
EFO could not be fully achieved without conflict with other values. Consider that parents naturally want to help their children develop the talents needed for competitive success. Some parents control a lot of resources useful for this purpose; some parents have few such resources. The ordinary interaction of parents with their children is then an obstacle to the achievement of equality of fair opportunity. If society were fully to achieve EFO, then either parental freedom to help their children in ways that give them a competitive edge would have to be curtailed or such help would have to be exactly offset by compensating infusion of social resources toward the education and socialization of children whose parents are less effective. (See Fishkin 1983).
3. Equality of Condition: Equality of What?
A society that satisfied the ideal of formal equality of opportunity might provide grim conditions of life for those who are unsuccessful in competitions for positions of advantage. Even a perfect meritocracy that satisfies the stringent Rawlsian equality of fair opportunity principle might impose the same grim conditions of life on those who lack marketable merit and skill. The class of competitive losers might include some who have adequate native talents but fail to make good use of them, but some of the losers will be those with the bad luck to be born without much by way of native talent. The question then arises whether any further substantive ideals of equality, beyond meritocratic ideals, should be affirmed. (See Schar 1967.)
One family of substantive equality ideals, equality of democratic citizenship and civil liberties, is perhaps no more controversial than formal equality of opportunity. Democratic equality embraces the norm that law-makers and top public officials should be selected in democratic elections. All adult nonretarded noncrazy citizens should be eligible to vote and run for office in free elections that operate against a backdrop of freedom of speech and association, and in which all votes count equally and majority rule prevails. All citizens should have the same wide rights to freedom of speech, assembly, association, and religious practice. Criminal justice rules should be applied evenhandedly to all and should embody the procedural values of the rule of law.
A controversial extension of democratic citizenship resembles Rawlsian equality of fair opportunity applied to the political arena. Call this ideal "equal participation." Equal participation requires that any individuals in society with the same ambition to influence the political process and the same talents of political persuasion and organization should have equal prospects of influence on the democratic political process. (See Christiano 1996, Walzer 1983, for a criticism, Estlund, 1999, and for a related view, J. Cohen 1989a.)
The remainder of this section surveys several proposals as to what (beyond democratic citizenship and civil liberties) should be distributed equally among the members of society and how equality and inequality in the distribution of these goods should be measured. The latter issue can be posed in this way: When various amounts of heterogeneous goods are held by different individuals, how can one measure individuals' overall holdings of goods so that it can be determined when people's overall holdings are effectively equal?
3.1 Lockean Rights
The Lockean rights approach is so named because an early prominent exponent of the doctrine was John Locke (Locke 1690). It might just as well be viewed as a rejection of egaltarianism rather than as a version of it. Contemporary Lockeans are also known as libertarians (see Nozick 1974).
The Lockean view is that every person has equal basic moral rights--natural rights. Natural rights are rights that one has independently of institutional arrangements and customary beliefs. A person's natural rights give her a set of claims against all other persons that each person absolutely must respect.
The traditional content of Lockean rights is roughly as follows: Each person has the right to do whatever she chooses with whatever she legitimately owns so long as she does not violate the rights of others not to be harmed in certain ways--by force, fraud, coercion, theft, or infliction of damage on person or property. Each person has the right not to be harmed by others in the mentioned ways, unless she voluntarily waives any of her rights or voluntarily transfers them to another or forfeits them by misconduct. Also, each adult person is the full rightful owner of herself and each child person has the right to be nurtured to adult status by those responsible for her creation. It is generally supposed in the Lockean tradition that starting from the premise of self-ownership, under actual conditions on earth one can validly derive strong rights of private appropriation and ownership of land and moveable parts of the earth (Nozick, 1974).
Lockean rights do not single out a state of affairs, that in which everyone's rights are fully respected, and hold that all people are obligated to act in whatever ways are needed to bring about this state of affairs. Each person's right generates a duty to respect that right on the part of every other person. Rights are constraints on what each individual may do, and do not set goals that all are together obligated to fulfill.
A more egalitarian variant of Lockean rights doctrine combines the right of self-ownership with skepticism about the Lockean account of the moral basis of private ownership rights. Instead the left-wing Lockean asserts that each person is the full rightful owner of herself and each adult person has a right to a per capita share of ownership of the unimproved land and resources of the earth. In short, this version of Lockeanism combines robust self-ownership with an egalitarian account of world ownership. There are several variants to this doctrine. Critics explore whether or not the doctrine is normatively stable: Do any plausible grounds there might be for denying Lockean private ownership of the world also generate grounds for denying individual self-ownership? Do any grounds there might be for resisting the denial of individual self-ownership also generate reasons to resist the denial of Lockean private ownership of the world? (See Steiner 1994, G. Cohen 1995, Vallentyne and Steiner 2000, and Van Parijs 1995).
3.2 Karl Marx on Equal Rights
The Marxian tradition in political and economic thought urges the desirability of eliminating some of the inequalities associated with the institutions of a capitalist market economy. Interpreting Karl Marx as an egalitarian normative theorist is a tricky undertaking, however, in view of the fact that he tends to eschew explicit theorizing on moral principles and to regard assertions of moral principles as so much ideological dust thrust in the eyes of the workers by defenders of capitalism.
In "The Critique of the Gotha Program," Marx asserts that in the first phase of communist society the economy will distribute goods according to the norm, to each according to his labor contribution. This norm can be regarded as defining an equal right, but like any such right, it is defective. One defect is that some individuals are naturally more able than others, and so the amount of one's labor contribution will vary depending on factors that vary by luck beyond one's power to control. For this and other reasons Marx asserts it will be desirable when a higher phase of communist society is attained. Then society can move beyond the sphere of bourgeois right altogether and operate according to the norm, from each according to his ability, to each according to his needs. Despite Marx's disclaimer, he seems to be proposing a principle of equal right: Each has the right to receive economic goods that satisfy her needs to the same extent provided she contributes to the economy according to her ability. But Marx would resist the description of this norm as a principle of justice or moral rights. One consideration in his mind may be that moral rights ought to be enforced, but when it is feasible and desirable to implement higher-phase communist distribution, the implementation can be carried out successfully without any legal or informal coercion, and hence should not occur through any process of social enforcement. Or so Marx thinks. (See Marx 1978, Wood 1981, Cohen, G., 1988 and 1995.)
3.3 Income and Wealth
In modern societies with market economies, an egalitarian is generally thought to be one who supports equality of income and wealth (income being a flow, wealth a stock). Respecting this usage, this entry considers an egalitarian in the broad sense to be someone who prefers in actual or at least non-exotic circumstances that people should be more nearly equal in income and wealth and favors policies that aim to bring about such equality.
Money is a conventional medium of exchange. Given an array of goods for sale at various prices, with some money one has the option to purchase any combination of these goods, within the budget constraint set by the amount of money one has. What money can purchase in a given society depends on the state of its economy and also on legal and cultural norms that may limit in various ways what is allowed to be put up for sale. For example, the laws may forbid the sale of sexual activity, human organs intended for transplant, the right to become a parent of a particular child by adoption, narcotic drugs, and so on. What money can purchase also obviously depends on what one is free to do with whatever one purchases--one may catch fish with the fishing rod one purchases only with a license and in accordance with rules issued by the state agency that regulates fishing.
Leaving these complications in the background, one can appreciate that having money gives one effective freedom to engage in a wide variety of activities and experiences. One has the option to purchase any of many commodities and do with them whatever is legally and conventionally allowed, up to the limit of one's budget. The ideal of equality of income and wealth is roughly the ideal that people should enjoy this effective freedom to the same extent.
This ideal is attractive to some and repulsive to others. One serious objection is that to bring about and sustain the condition in which all people have the same amount of money would require continuous and extensive violation of people's Lockean rights, which as standardly understood include the right to gain more property than others possess by gift or trade or hard work. Another, closely related objection is that a regime of equal money could be maintained only by wrongful interference with people's liberty, because if money is distributed equally at one time people will choose to act in ways that over time will tend to result in unequal distribution of money at later times. (For the first objection, see Nozick 1974, chapter 7, for the second, see Walzer 1983.)
Another objection to the ideal of monetary equality is that its pursuit would inhibit people's engagement in wealth-creating and wealth-saving activity, and in the not very long run would reduce society's stock of wealth and make us all worse off in the terms of the effective freedom that was being equalized. Yet another objection is that people behave in ways that render them more and less deserving, and monetary good fortune is among the types of things that people come to deserve differentially.
The advocate of egalitarianism in the broad sense has some replies. Unless some substantive argument is given as to why Lockean rights should be accorded moral deference, the mere fact that equality conflicts with Lockean rights does not by itself impugn the ideal of equality. Maybe some purported "rights" should not be regarded as momentous, and their sacrifice to secure equality might be acceptable on balance. In the same vein, one might hold that the fact that continuous restriction of individual liberty is needed to satisfy some norm does not by itself tell us whether the moral gain from satisfying the ideal is worth the moral cost of lessened freedom. Some restrictions of liberty are undeniably worth their cost, and some ideal of equality might be among the values that warrant some sacrifice of liberty.
Equality might be upheld as one value among others, and increase in wealth or in wealth per capita may be included along with equality in a pluralistic ethics. We may want more effective freedom (of the sort money combined with goods for sale provides), and we may also want this freedom equally distributed, and then we would need to find an acceptable compromise of these values to deal with cases when they conflict in practice. Much the same might be said about the conflict between the achievement of equality of money and the distribution of good fortune according to people's differential desert.
Monetary equality can strike one as a misguided ideal for the different reason that it does not deal in what is of fundamental importance. The value of purchasing power, equal or unequal, depends on the value of what is for sale. Imagine that the economy of a society is organized so it produces only trivial knick-knacks. Freedom to purchase trivia is a trivial freedom, and rendering it equal does not significantly improve matters. (Critics of consumerism and consumer culture are moved by the idea that in actual modern societies, the economy, responsive to consumer demand, is responsive to demands for what is not very worthwhile and ignores many truly imporrtant human goods, that either happen to be not for sale or that by their nature are not suitable for sale on a market.)
Another concern about monetary equality is that purchasing power interacts with individuals' personal powers and traits, and real freedom reflects the interaction, which an emphasis on purchasing power alone conceals. Consider two persons, one of whom is blind, legless, and armless, while the other has good eyesight and full use of her limbs. Given equal money, the first must spend his money on devices and services to cope with his handicaps, while the second may purchase far more of what she likes. Here equality of purchasing power seems to leave the two very unequal in real freedom to live their lives as they choose. But the case of handicaps is just an extreme instance of what is always present, namely each individual has a set of traits and natural powers bestowed by genetic inheritance and early socialization, and these differ greatly across persons and greatly affect people's access to valuable ways to live.
3.4 Capabilities
One response to the problematic features of the monetary equality ideal is to shift to the notion of real freedom as that which an egalitarian morality should be concerned to equalize. Real or effective freedom contrasts with formal freedom. You are formally free to go to Canada just in case no law or convention backed by penalties prevents you from going and no one would coercively interfere if you attempted to travel there. In contrast, you are really or effectively free to go to Canada just in case this is an option that you may choose--if you choose to go and seriously try to go, you will get there, and if you do not choose to go and make a serious attempt to go, you do not get there. (One might lack formal freedom to do something yet be really free to do it, if one was able to evade or overcome the legal and extralegal obstacles to doing that thing.)
Another response to the problematic features of the monetary equality ideal aims to cope with the thought that freedom of purchasing power may not be of great importance. The response is to characterize what we should be equalizing in terms that directly express what is reasonably regarded as truly important.
Both responses are present in a proposal made by Amartya Sen in several publications beginning in 1980 (see Sen 1980 and 1992 and the references cited in Sen 1992). Sen suggests that in so far as we should value equality of condition, what we should value is equal real freedom, and more specifically basic functioning capability equality. People may function--do or be something--in any of a huge number of ways. Consider all of the different ways that one might function variously. Many of these are trivial or of little importance; set these to the side. Consider then basic functionings, functionings that are essential or important for human flourishing or valuable agency. Consider all of the packages of functionings that an individual at a time is really free to choose all at once; these are one's capabilities at a time. We may also consider an individual's basic capabilities over the life course. The proposal is that society should sustain basic capability equality. (Care must be taken in identifying an individual's capability sets, since what others choose may affect the freedom one has. One may have the option of choosing the functioning of attending college, but only if not too many persons in one's high school cohort make the same choice.)
We might construe "basic capability" as picking out one of the capabilities needed for a minimally decent life. For example, being able to obtain enjoyment in life and gain scientific knowledge that meet threshold levels deemed "good enough" suffice to give one basic enjoyment and basic knowledge capabilities. Above that threshold level for each capability, differences in the level of capability that people can attain do not signify--they do not change the fact that everyone does or does not enjoy equal basic capabilies. To get equal basic capability for everyone would be to get each person at or above the threshold level for every one of the capabilities that are specified to be necessary for a minimally decent or good enough life. So understood, the basic capability proposal falls in the family of sufficientarian ideals; on which, see the section on "Sufficiency" below.
The capability approach to equality can be developed in different ways depending on how basic capabilities are identified.
Some theorists have explored the capability approach by tying it to an objective account of human well-being or flourishing. The aim is to identify all of the functionings needed for human flourishing. For each of these functionings, the ideal is that each person should be sustained in the capability to engage in every one of these functionings at a satisfactory or good enough level. (See Nussbaum 1990, 1992, and 1999.)
Another use of the capability approach ties it to the idea of what is needed for each person to function as a full participating member of modern democratic society. Each person is to be sustained throughout her life, so far as this is feasible, in the capabilities to function at a satisfactory level in all of the ways necessary for full membership and participation in democratic society. (See Anderson 1999 and Walzer 1983.)
It should be noted that the capability approach as described so far involves the assumption that anything whatever that reduces or expands an individual's real freedom to function in ways that are valuable should trigger a response on the part of a society or agency that aims to establish and sustain capability equality. One might reject this assumption while otherwise working within the capability framework. One might distinguish aspects of a person's situation that are socially caused from those that are naturally caused. This distinction is evidently rough and needs refinement, but one has some sense of what is intended. That I am unable to run fast or sing a tune on key may be largely due to my genetic endowment, which in this context we may take to be naturally rather than socially caused. In contrast, the facts that given the talents of others and their choices to use them in market interaction, my running ability is nonmarketable but my singing ability enables me to have a career as a professional singer are deemed socially caused. That I have a certain physical appearance is natural (any of a wide variety of childrearing regimens would have produced pretty much this same physical appearance) but that my appearance renders me ineligible for marriage or romantic liaisons is a social fact (social arrangements bring this about and different social arrangements might undo it).
However exactly the natural and social are distinguished, one might restrict the scope of an equality ideal to the smoothing out of socially caused inequalities. As Elizabeth Anderson remarks, "The proper negative aim of egalitarian justice is not to eliminate the impact of brute luck from human affairs, but to end oppression, which by definition is socially imposed" (Anderson 1999, p. 288). What this restriction amounts to depends on how one distinguishes socially caused from other inequalities. Suppose that society pursues policy A, and that if it pursued policy B instead, a given inequality across people would disappear. Does this fact suffice to qualify the inequality as socially caused or not?
Critics of the capability approach home in on three of its features.
The starting point of the capability approach is that the equality that matters morality or that we are morally required to sustain is equality of freedom of some sort. This starting point is open to challenge. Freedom is no doubt important as a means to many other goods and as something everyone cares about to some considerable extent. But why confine the concern of equality to freedom rather than to achieved outcomes? Suppose that we could supply resources to Smith that will expand her freedom, but we happen to know that this freedom will do nobody any good. She will neglect it and it will be wasted. In these circumstances, why supply the resources? If provision of freedom for its own sake is morally of first-priority importance, then the fact that freedom in this instance will do nobody any good would seem to be an irrelevant consideration. If this fact seems highly pertinent to what we should do, this indicates that freedom may not be the ultimate value the distribution of which is the proper concern of an equality ideal.
Another feature of the capability approach as elaborated to this point is that it does not appear to register the significance of personal responsibility as it might appropriately qualify the formulation of an equality ideal (Roemer 1996 and 1998). A simple example illustrates the difficulty. Suppose society is dedicated to sustaining all of its members equally at some level of basic capability. Society provides resources fully adequate for sustaining an individual at this level of basic capability, but he frivolously and negligently squanders the resources. The resources are re-supplied, and squandered again, and the cycle continues. At some point in the cycle, many people would urge that the responsibility of society has been fulfilled, and that it is the individual's responsibility to use provided resources in reasonable ways, if his lack of adequate basic capability is to warrant a claim to equality-restoring social intervention. The capability approach could of course be modified to accommodate responsibility concerns. But it will be useful to turn to consideration of the resourcist approach, within which the aim of integrating equality and responsibility has prompted various proposals.
A third feature of the capability approach that has elicited criticism is the idea that knowledge of human flourishing and what facilitates it must inform the identification of an adequate equality norm. The worry in a nutshell is that in modern societies that secure wide freedoms, people will embrace many opposed conceptions of how to live and of what is choiceworthy in human life. These are matters about which we must agree to disagree. At least if an ideal of equality is being constructed to serve in a public conception of justice that establishes basic terms of morality for a modern democratic society, this ideal must eschew controversial claims about human good and human flourishing such as those in which the capability approach must become embroiled. Martha Nussbaum explores how the capability approach to social equality might function appropriately as a public conception of justice (Nussbaum 2000). Charles Larmore argues that it is wrong for government to impose a policy that could only be justified by appeal to the claim that some controversial conception of the good is superior to another (Larmore 1987 and 1996; for criticism, see Sher 1997). In response it might be urged that a conception of human capabilities might be controversial but true, and if known to be true, appropriately imposed by government policy.
3.5 Resources
The ideal of equality of resources can be understood by recognizing its enemies. These enemies comprise all manner of proposals that suppose that in so far as we should care about equality of condition across persons, what we should care about equalizing is the utility or welfare or well-being or good that persons attain over the course of their lives. John Rawls offers an especially clear statement of the animating impulse of the equality of resources ideal. He imagines someone proposing that the relevant measure of people's condition for a theory of justice is their level of plan fullfillment or attained satisfaction, and responds that his favored conception "takes a different view. For it does not look behind the use which persons make of the rights and opportunities available to them in order to measure, much less to maximize, the satisfactions they achieve. Nor does it try to evaluate the relative merits of different conceptions of the good. Instead, it is assumed that the members of society are rational persons able to adjust their conceptions of the good to their situation." (See Rawls 1971, section 15.) Resourcist ideals of equality of condition are nonwelfarist.
Several thoughts are intertwined here. One is that equality of condition must be developed as a component of an acceptable theory of justice, intended to be the basic charter of a democratic society and acceptable to all reasonable members of such a society, who are presumed to be disposed to disagree interminably about many ultimate issues concerning religion and the meaning and worth of human life (Rawls 1993). We must seek reasonable terms of cooperation that people who disagree about much can nonetheless accept. If there is anything that people cannot reasonably be expected to agree about, it is what constitutes human good, so introducing a controversial conception of human good as part and parcel of the ideal of equality that is to be at the core of the principles of justice is a bad mistake.
Another thought is that responsible individuals will consider themselves to have a personal obligation, which cannot be shifted to the government or any agency of society, to decide for themselves what is worthwhile in human life and what is worth seeking and to fashion (and refashion as changing circumstances warrant) a plan of life to achieve worthwhile ends. So even if the true theory of human good could be discovered, it would offend the dignity and sense of responsibility of individual persons for some agency of society to preempt this individual responsibility by arranging matters so that everyone achieves human good understood a certain way to a sufficiently high degree. Individuals should take responsibility for their ends. (See Rawls 1971, Rakowski 1992, Dworkin 2000).
Another thought that motivates the family of equality-of-resources ideals is that society's obligations by way of providing for its members are limited. A just and egalitarian society is not plausibly held to be obligated to do whatever turns out to be necessary to bring it about that their members attain any given level or share of quality of life. The reason for this is that the quality of life (the degree to which one attains valuable agency and well-being goals) that any individual reaches over the course of her life depends on many choices and actions taken by that very individual, so to a considerable extent, the quality of life one reaches must be up to oneself, not the job of society or some agency acting on behalf of society. Along these lines, the actual course of an individual's life and the degree of fulfillment it reaches also depend on many chance factors for which nobody can reasonably be held accountable. Justice is a practical ideal, not a Don Quixote conception that aims to correct all bad luck of any sort that befalls persons. A reasonable morality understands the social justice obligations of society as limited, not open-ended and unbounded. So if equality of condition is part of social justice, it too must reflect an appropriately limited conception of social responsibility. Equality of resources fills this bill. (See Daniels 1990 and chapters 3 and 4 of Buchanan et al. 2000.)
The trick then is to develop an appropriate conception of resources that can serve in an ideal of equality of condition.
Resources can be external, material goods, such as land and moveable property. One can also extend the domain, and consider traits of persons that are latent talents or instruments that help them to achieve their ends as also included within the set of resources to be equalized. Extending the domain in this way will introduce complexity into the account, because personal talents are attached to persons and cannot simply be transferred to others who lack talent.
Notice that in elaborating equality of resources, it is assumed that a population of individuals with given traits, generated by genetic inheritance and early socialization, is present, and equalization is to proceed by adjusting features of the individuals' environment or by altering features of the individuals, say by extra education. But of course, moral questions may also be raised about the processes by which individuals come to be born and given early socialization so as to endow them with certain traits. With genetic information about an individual made available to prospective parents before the individual is born, a decision can be made about whether to bring this child to term. In the future, genetic enhancements may be available that can alter the genetic makeup of individuals, and again a morality must consider when enhancements should be supplied and by whom. Raising these questions makes it evident that just assuming an initial population of individuals with given traits takes for granted matters that are very much morally up for grabs (see Buchanan et al. 2000). For the purposes of this entry, this complication is noted only to be set aside.
How can resources be identified and rated? We want to be able to say, given two persons each with different amounts of resources, which one has more resources overall. The literature to date reveals two ways of confronting the question. One has been developed by John Rawls (Rawls 1971), one by Ronald Dworkin (Dworkin, 2000).
Rawls suggests that the conception of resources to be deployed in a resourcist ideal of equality is primary social goods. These are defined as distributeable goods that a rational person prefers to have more rather than less of, whatever else she wants. (A variant conception identifies them as goods that any rational person would want who gives priority to her interest in cooperating with others on fair terms, selecting and if need be revising a conception of the good and a set of life aims, and pursuing the conception and the aims.) On this approach it is not so far clear how to measure a person's holding of social primary goods overall if there are various primary goods and one has different amounts of the different kinds. The primary goods approach has yet to be developed in detail. Rawls has suggested that the scope of this problem of devising an index of primary goods is lessened by giving some primary goods, the basic liberties, priority over the rest. For the remainder, Rawls suggests that the relative weight of primary goods can be set by considering what people (regarded as free and equal citizens) need. (See Rawls 2001, section 17.)
Dworkin's approach begins with the idea that the measure of a resource that one person holds is what others would be willing to give up to get it. From this standpoint competitive market prices are the appropriate measure of the resources one possesses: In particular, the division of a lot of resources among a group of people is equal when all are given equal purchasing power for the occasion and all the resources are sold off in an auction in which no one's bids are final until no one wants to change her bids given the bids of the others.
This equal auction is just a first approximation to Dworkin's proposal. Two complications need to be introduced. One is that one ought to extend the domain of resources to include personal talents as well as external property. A second is that equality of resources as conceived in this construction supposes that the results of unchosen luck, but not chosen option luck, should be equalized.
Take the second wrinkle first. If we start from an initial equality of resources brought about by the equal auction mechanism, individuals might then go on to use and invest and spend their resource allotments in various ways. Assume the rules mediating their interaction are set and morally unproblematic. Roughly speaking, we say people are free to interact with others on any mutually agreeable terms but not to impose the costs of their activities on others without the mediation of voluntary consent. Starting from an initial equality of resources, any results that issue from voluntary interactions reiterated over time do not offend against the equality ideal. Let voluntary choice and chosen luck prevail.
The first wrinkle is that individuals differ in their unchosen natural talent resource allotments. These should somehow be equalized. But how? The Dworkin proposal is that we can in thought establish an insurance market, in which people who do not know whether they will be born disabled (afflicted with negative talents) and do not know what market price their positive talents will fetch, can insure themselves in a variant of the equal purchasing power auction against the possibility of being handicapped or having talents that fetch low market price. In this way in thought unchosen luck is transformed into morally inoffensive chosen luck (so far as this is thinkable).
The final Dworkin proposal then is that the thought experiment of the equal auction modified as above is used to estimate in actual circumstances in a rough and ready way who is worse off and who better off than others through no choice of her own. A tax and transfer policy is instituted then that tries to mimic the results of the imaginary equal auction. To the extent that we establish and sustain such policies--voila!--we have equality of resources across the members of an actual society. (See Dworkin 2000).
The Dworkin proposal is noteworthy for its integration of themes of equality and personal responsibility in a single conception. But the moral appropriateness of linking these themes is open to question.
The most far-reaching skepticism on this point denies that personal responsibility can be more than instrumentally valuable, a tool for securing other values. One might hold that in a world in which human choices are events and all events are caused by prior events according to physical laws, responsibility can make sense pragmatically and instrumentally in various settings but does not really make good normative sense under scrutiny. One might reach a similar result by noting that even if persons are truly responsible for making some choices rather than others, what we could reasonably be held responsible for and what surely lies beyond our power to control run together to produce actual results and cannot be disentangled. On this view, if we care about equality, we should seek not responsibility-modified equality but straight equality of condition, using responsibility norms only as incentives and prods to bring about equality (or a close enough approximation to it) at a higher level of material well-being.
Another sort of skepticism challenges whether the broad project of holding people responsible for their chosen luck but not for their unchosen luck really makes sense, because unchosen luck of genetic inheritance and early socialization fixes the individual's choice-making and value-selecting abilities. What one chooses, bad or good, may simply reflect the unchosen luck that gave one the ability to be a good or a bad chooser. Suppose for example that Smith chooses to experiment with cigarettes and heroin, and these gambles turn out badly in the form of contraction of lung cancer and long-term hard drug addiction. He is then far worse off than others, but his bad fortune comes about through his own choice--hence is not compensable according to Dworkinian equality of resources. But that Smith chooses these bad gambles and Jones does not may simply reflect the unchosen bad luck that Smith had in his genetic inheritance and early socialization. So holding him fully responsible for the fortune he encounters through chosen gambles may make no sense if we follow through the underlying logic of the Dworkin proposal itself. This takes us back to welfarist equality conceptions, which the resourcist theorist wishes to steer away from at all cost.
3.6 Welfare and Opportunity for Welfare
The ideal of equality of welfare holds that it is desirable that the amount of human good gained by each person for herself (and by others for her) over the course of her life should be the same. Human good, also known as welfare or well-being or utility, is what an individual gets insofar as her life goes well for herself (Parfit, 1984). This awkward phrase is meant to distinguish one's life going well for oneself, as one would wish one's life to go from the standpoint of rational prudence, and its going well by way of producing good that enters the lives of other people or animals or fulfills some impersonal good cause. Suppose my life in its entirety consists in sticking my finger in a dike and slowly painfully freezing to death, like the little Dutch boy in the children's fable. So lived, this life produces lots of good for millions of people saved from flood and drowning, but for me it produces no good, just slow misery. The life just imagined is a good in the sense of morally admirable life but not a life that contains much welfare or human good for the one living it.
The background thought is then that morality is concerned with the production and fair distribution of human good. Nothing else ultimately matters (except animal and nonhuman person welfare, but leave these important qualifications aside). So to the extent we believe that fair distribution is equal distribution, that morality requires that everyone get the same, what everyone should then have the same of is human good or welfare or well-being.
To work out this conception of equality of condition would involve determining what account of the nature of human good is most plausible. One account is hedonism, which holds the good to be pleasure and absence of pain. Another account identifies the good with desire satisfaction or life aim fulfillment. A variant of this last approach holds that the relevant aims and desires are those that would withstand ideal reflection with full information unmarred by cognitive error (such as adding two and two and getting five). A quite different account supposes that the good is constituted by the items on a list of objectively valuable beings and doings. The more the individual attains the items on the objective list over the course of her life, the better her life goes, whatever her subjective opinions and attitudes about such attainments might be. The most plausible conception of the ideal of equality of welfare incorporates whatever is the best theory of human good or welfare. (In this connection see Griffin 1986 and Hurka 1990.)
Any such account bumps into problems concerning personal responsibility and the sense that the obligations of society are limited--problems already mentioned in this discussion. A society bent on sustaining equality of welfare would continue pouring resources down the drain if worse off individuals insist on negligently squandering whatever resources are expended on them in order to boost their welfare level up to the average level. One might respond to this responsibility challenge by stipulating that equality is only desirable on the condition that individuals are equally responsible or deserving: It is bad if some are worse off than others through no fault or choice of their own. In a slogan, one might assert an ideal of equality of opportunity for welfare. (See Cohen 1989, Arneson 1989, and for criticism Rakowski 1992, Fleurbaey 1995, Scanlon 1997, and Wolff 1998).
Another criticism does not so much challenge the welfarist interpretation of equality of condition but presses the issue, how much weight any such equality of condition ideal should have in competition with other values. Imagine for example that some people, the severely disabled, are far worse off than others, and are through no fault or choice of their own extremely poor transformers of resources into welfare. A society bent on sustaining equality of welfare or equal opportunity for welfare as a first priority would be obligated to continue transferring resources from better off to worse off no matter how many better off people must then suffer any amount of welfare loss just so long as the pertinent welfare condition of a single still worse off individual can be improved even by a tiny amount.
Another criticism challenges the welfarist conceptions of equality of condition directly. One observes that in a diverse modern society, individuals will reasonably disagree about what is ultimately good and worthwhile in human life. Hence no conception of welfare is available to serve as a consensus standard for a public morality acceptable to all reasonable persons. In a similar spirit, one might invoke the idea that responsible individuals cannot acquiesce in the assumption of the responsibility on the part of the government to determine what is worthwhile and choiceworthy for them, for this responsibility rests squarely on each individual's shoulders and cannot legitimately be dislodged from that perch. (See especially Dworkin, 2000, chapter 7, also Arneson 2000.)
3.7 Conclusion: A Test Case
Philosophical discussions of what should be equalized if we care about equality of condition raise dust that has not yet settled in any sort of consensus. All the rival views canvassed encounter difficulties, the seriousness of which is at present hard to discern.
It should be noted that the issue, how to measure people's condition for purposes of a theory of equality, connects to a broader issue, how to measure people's condition for purposes of a theory of fair distribution. Equality is just one of the possible views that might be taken as to what fair treatment requires. (For example, the sufficientarian and prioritarian principles discussed in the text below both admit of resourcist and welfarist variants.) Any theory of distributive jsutice that says that sometimes better off persons should improve the situation of worse off persons requires an account of the basis of interpersonal comparisons that enables us to determine who is better off and who is worse off.
Finally, the reader might wish to test the merits of rival answers to the equality-of-what question by considering a social justice issue different in character from the issues considered so far. Suppose a society is divided into two or more linguistic communities, one being by far the most populous. The language of the dominant community is the official language of public life, and a minority linguistic group demands redress in the name of social equality. The minority group seeks government action to help sustain and promote the survival and flourishing of the minority linguistic community. For another example, suppose a modern democratic society contains more or less intact remnants of hunter-gatherer bands who claim in the name of social equality the right to withdraw from the larger surrounding society and practice their traditional way of life and run their affairs autonomously. How should a society committed to an ideal of equality of condition handle this type of issue? (See Kymlicka 1995, Young 1990, Anderson 1999, and Barry 2001.)
4. Equality among Whom?
Settling which aspect of people's condition (if any) should be the same for all and fixing a measure of people's condition in this respect still does not render an ideal of equality of condition fully determinate.
So far the question remains open, among whom should equality of condition obtain?
At some spots the discussion to this point has assumed an answer to this question. The issue is posed, in what ways should the members of a society or nation state be made equal? Framing the issue in this way presumes that what is morally valuable is that equality prevails among the members of each separate society. The idea then is that it is desirable that the condition of the inhabitants of India should be rendered more equal and that the condition of inhabitants of Germany should be rendered more equal but that equalizing the condition of Germans and Indians combined need not be desirable. But why not? (On this issue, see Dworkin 2000 and Rawls, "The Law of Peoples," in Rawls 1999.)
If equality is prized as a means to other values, it may be the case that only equality among individuals who interact in significant ways has a tendency to promote the desired further goals. For example, if we prize equality of possessions to foster social solidarity, it may be that producing equality among people who live in distant parts of the globe and hardly interact will have no tendency to promote solidarity across the combined population. For the instrumental egalitarian, one should seek equality among those collections of people in which equality would produce the desired further results.
If equality is valued for its own sake, rather than as a means to further goals, it is less clear why the domain of persons among whom equality should obtain is limited in space or time or by political boundaries. Why not hold that it is desirable that equality should prevail to the degree this is feasible among all persons who shall ever live?
This question may not be rhetorical. One view is that when people set up a wide-ranging system of coercion on the scale of a political nation, special moral requirements come into play, including a requirement that all whose lives are ruled by this system of coercion should be treated equally or brought to an equal condition in some respects. (If a world government were established, the special requirements would be global in scope.) (See Miller 1998.)
The question, whether the requirement of equalizing people's condition applies within particular societies but not across societies on a global scale, might be thought to raise a rough dilemma for the normative attractiveness of any equality ideal. The dilemma arises in the following train of thought. On the one hand, there is no good basis for restricting the scope of equality. If equality matters, the group that should be made equal is people everywhere. On the other hand, a global equality requirement will strike many as deeply counterintuitive because it seems to impose very demanding requirements on prosperous individuals and nations to share their wealth with less prosperous strangers in distant lands. The dilemma paints egalitarianism as either parochial or Quixotic and utopian. To remove this impression of dilemma, it would suffice either to defend the restriction of egalitarian requirements to single societies or to show that the requirements of demanding global egalitarianism are not really counterintuitive.
Further issues may be raised about the nature of the individuals among whom equality should obtain. One might hold that across whatever kind of group is deemed to be the relevant domain of equality, individuals should be made equal in condition over the course of their lives. Another possibility is that the individual persons at the same stage of the life cycle should be rendered equal in condition. On this latter view, a society in which over time the people who are old all enjoy the same condition, and likewise the people who are young and those who are middle-aged, could perfectly conform to the ideal of equality of condition even if the old are (say) far better off than the middle-aged and the middle-aged are always far better off than the young. Another possible view is that equality should be formulated so it demands that from now, the condition of all those living should be equalized (regardless of what condition people enjoyed in the past). (See McKerlie 1989 and 2001 and Temkin 1993, chapter 8).
Another issue emerges if one asks: why focus on individual persons rather than on groups? One might hold that it is not important that individual persons have equal life prospects, but it is morally valuable that men and women on the whole should have equal life prospects, that heterosexuals and nonheterosexualls should have the same life prospects, that people of different supposed races should have the same life prospects on the whole, and so on. To fill out this proposal one would need to develop a normative account that explains what sorts of group classifications matter for this purpose and on what grounds. Notice that one might be troubled, for example, if it is found that men have better life prospects on the average than women, because that would be an indicator that perhaps equality of opportunity and equality of fair opportunity are not satisfied. To be moved by this consideration is not to value equality of condition across groups per se.
Finally, the discussion in this entry assumes that if equality is valuable or morally required, the equality that matters is equality among human persons. Equality across individual humans and individual members of other animal species has not been envisaged. But why not? If human beings are picked out as morally special, some reasonable ground must be adduced for this selection. In view of the fact that there might be intelligent beings who qualify as persons but are nonhuman (angels, intelligent extraterrestrials, and so on), perhaps we should focus on persons and consider whether equality of condition should prevail among persons and only among persons and if so, on what basis. Notice that the claim that human persons share a special equal status from which less intelligent animals are excluded still allows that these animals, though not equal in status to humans, may nonetheless be morally considerable.
5. Is Equality Desirable Per Se? Varieties of Egalitarianism
Why should it matter that people have or get the same? In previous sections of this entry some attempt has been made to clarify some principles that prize equality of condition of some sort. No doubt in some circumstances movement toward equality of some sort can be expected to increase the extent to which other values worth caring about are achieved. The question here is whether the achievement of equality of condition of any sort matters for its own sake, independently of whether it hinders or promotes the attainment of other values.
In considering this question, one should beware of conflating equality per se with distinct and independent values that in some circumstances will closely shadow it. The values that might be confounded with equality include sufficiency, priority, and desert.
5.1 Sufficiency
Suppose one compares the grim conditions of life endured by the poorest inhabitants of the earth with the garishly opulent conditions of life enjoyed by the wealthiest people. A natural reaction is that it is morally outrageous that such inequalities in life prospects exist. As George Orwell once wrote, "a fat man eating quails while children are begging for bread is a disgusting sight" (Orwell, 1938, p. 115). But one may wonder if what is troubling about the example is the gap between rich and poor or rather the deplorable condition of the poor, which might continue unabated even if the gap itself were eliminated. To put the issue another way, if it is the inequality per se that is bad, then the gap between poor and rich would seem to be no worse than a same-sized gap between the life prospects of the rich and super-rich. If the latter inequality strikes one as morally inconsequential, the question arises whether inequality is in and of itself really objectionable. Perhaps the problem is not that the poor have less than the rich, but rather that the poor do not have enough--a sufficient level of resources to provide a good life or a reasonable prospect of a good life. The suggestion then is that sufficiency not equality is what per se matters. How one's condition compares to the situation of other people is not important in itself. What is morally important is that people have enough to bring them over the threshold of decent life prospects. (For this line of thought, see Frankfurt 1987).
The doctrine of sufficiency holds that it is morally valuable that as many as possible of all who shall ever live should enjoy conditions of life that place them above the threshold that marks the minimum required for a decent (good enough) quality of life. Sufficiency can rationalize egalitarian transfers of resources from better off to worse off persons when such transfers would increase the total number of people who ever achieve sufficiency.
A potential problem for the sufficiency doctrine is that it may not be possible nonarbitrarily to specify a line of sufficiency such that moving a person just across that line has great moral significance. If the sufficiency doctrine were asserted either as a complete theory of justice or as a principle that trumps all competitors, it would definitely be problematic. Suppose a large number of people are unavoidably below sufficiency, leading hellish lives, and that transfer of resources could vastly improve their lives while leaving them below the sufficient level. Instead we could use these same resources to boost a single person who is now just barely under sufficiency to just barely over it. Sufficiency as a trumping doctrine says that we ought to do what will increase the total number of persons who ever achieve sufficiency no matter what the cost to other moral values. This is worse than dubious. A similar difficulty emerges when one imagines cases in which many people are unavoidably over the sufficiency level, but with a resource infusion their lives will be vastly improved, and in which the same resources could instead be used to prevent a single person now just above sufficiency from falling a hair beneath this line.
5.2 Priority
There is another route to the conclusion that equality per se is not morally valuable. Consider again the scenario in which the poorest inhabitants of the earth face grim and miserable conditions of existence and the richest enjoy an enormously better quality of life. The sufficientarian's diagnosis of this situation is that what is bad about this scenario is not the inequality, the gap between rich and poor, but the fact that the poor do not have enough. An alternative diagnosis can most easily be explained by supposing that we have a cardinal interpersonal measure of welfare or well-being. An individual's level of well-being registers how well her life is going as it would be assessed from the standpoint of rational prudence. An individual's level of well-being is the level of benefits or advantages for herself that her life contains. From this perspective, when one speaks of "better off" and "worse off" persons, one is speaking of persons whose lifetime level of well-being is high or low.
With this bit of background in place, the idea that transfers of resources from better off to worse off persons are sometimes morally desirable can be understood without supposing either that equality of any sort is per se desirable or that there is some level of well-being that marks the good enough level and that has a special status as specified by the sufficiency doctrine. Suppose that for any person, the lower her lifetime well-being score--the amount of well-being she gains or is now expected to gain over the course of her life--the more morally valuable it would be to secure an incremental gain of well-being for her (or to avoid a small loss). This is the root idea of prioritarianism.
The prioritarian idea is to be sharply distinguished from the idea that across some range, resources secured for a person have declining marginal utility. To illustrate, suppose one person is leading a hellish existence and another is leading a life of sheer bliss. We might think that a single unit of some generally useful resource such as water is likely to do more good, result in a greater aggregate of well-being among all persons, if the unit is provided to the person suffering in hell rather than the person enjoying heavenly bliss. This may be so. The straight utilitarian of well-being will then favor provision of the unit of water to the inhabitant of hell. Now suppose instead that a unit of some resource would provide exactly the same increase in well-being if it is provided either to the person leading the hellish or the person leading the blissful life. (Perhaps the person already in bliss is a very efficient transformer of resources into personal well-being.) The prioritarian gives priority to getting benefits to those whose well-being level is low, so will favor helping the miserable rather than the lucky person even if the well-being aggregate is thereby reduced a bit, compared to what it would have been if the resource had been channeled to the blissful person.
Prioritarianism holds that the moral value of achieving a benefit for an individual (or avoiding a loss) is greater, the greater the size of the benefit as measured by a well-being scale, and greater, the lower the person's level of well-being over the course of her life apart from receipt of this benefit. Well-being weighted by priority as just specified is sometimes called "weighted well-being." To this account of value the prioritarian adds the position that one ought to act, and institutions should be arranged, so as to maximize moral value as defined. (See chapter 2 of Scheffler 1982, Weirich 1983, Parfit 1997).
An attractive feature of the priority doctrine is that it will never yield the implication that there is something good, from the standpoint of egalitarian values, in bringing about equality or a clear move in the direction of equality by making better off persons worse off without bringing about any offsetting gain at all to worse off persons. Suppose there are rich peasants and poor peasants and there is nothing we can do to improve the lives of the poor peasants. We could, however, burn the grain storehouses of the rich peasants, rendering them worse off but still no worse off than the poor peasants. If equality is desirable for itself, then there is something positive to be said about the destruction of the grain storehouses in the example, even if it is also the case that there is an offsetting negative feature of the transition to the new status quo, namely that the well-being of the rich peasants precipitously declines. If equality were to be deemed a value that takes priority over all others, a trumping value, then we would be committed to asserting that the state of affairs after levelling down is all things considered morally better than the status quo ante. The prioritarian faces no such embarrassment in her responses to levelling down scenarios such as the example just described.
Another attractive feature of prioritarianism is that it promises to combine in a single determinate principle the values of well-being maximization and priority for the badly off. So elaborated, the priority doctrine would contain a solution to the problem of integrating the values of efficiency and equality broadly understood. But this advantage is just notional pending a determination of how to weight the competing values of well-being gains and priority in a single principle. As stated, the priority doctrine does not specify a determinate principle but a family of principles. At one extreme, hardly any weight is given to priority as it competes with maximizing well-being, and the prioritarian doctrine is then barely distinguishable from straight act utilitarianism with utility identified with well-being. At the other extreme, hardly any weight is given to maximizing well-being as it competes with priority, and the prioritarian doctrine is then barely distinguishable from the maximin principle with well-being as the maximand. (Maximin holds that one should choose that policy, among the alternatives, that brings about the best position for the worst off individual affected by the policy choice.)
The priority doctrine has been explicated as a version of welfarism. One can see that the prioritarian idea iself is separable from any commitment to welfarism. In general terms, the prioritarian holds that the moral value of gaining a benefit for a person is greater, the lower the benefit level of the person prior to receipt of the increment, and greater, the greater the size of the benefit. So stated, the doctrine admits of various interpretations that put different constructions on the idea of "greater benefit." For example, if benefit is identified with the Rawlsian idea of a primary social good, and one takes prioritarianism to the limit of maximin, one then has the Rawlsian conception, that justice in most general terms is bringing about the best possible outome for the very worst off. (See Rawls 1971, chapter 2, and for a defense of maximin, J. Cohen 1989.)
5.3 Desert
Egalitarian transfers will in some circumstances be recommended by yet another principle that cares nothing for equality per se (Kagan 1999). This is the principle of desert: It is desirable that each person should gain good fortune corresponding to her virtue (deservingness). As construed here, the desert principle presupposes that individuals' virtue is cardinally interpersonally measureable. A number can then be assigned to each person indicating that person's level of virtue; persons assigned higher numbers have greater virtue. Suppose that for each number there is a specific amount of good fortune or well-being that an individual with that number indicating her amount of virtue deserves to have. This is the level of good fortune that corresponds to one's virtue. This level is higher for the more virtuous, lower for the less virtuous. (One might allow that very nonvirtuous persons deserve some level of bad fortune or negative well-being.)
Suppose one adds to the desert principle the further norm that when a person has less than she deserves, it is morally more valuable to gain an increment of good fortune for that person, the greater the gap between what she has and what she deserves. Call the further norm the greater gap principle. Accepting the desert principle and the greater gap principle, one will then sometimes favor egalitarian transfers purely from considerations of desert.
Suppose that two people are equally deserving (virtuous) but that one is worse off than the other. If one has a bit of resource to distribute, and it would provide a one-unit gain in well-being for either of the two individuals if either one got it, then it is morally more valuable to get the benefit to the person who is worse off, because she is farther from enjoying what she deserves than the other. In a similar way, if resources could be transferred from the better off person to the worse off, with the result that the better off person loses a unit of well-being and the worse off person gains one unit, this transfer would result in a morally more valuable state of affairs according to the combination of the desert principle and the greater gap principle. In such cases principles of desert favor transfers from better off to worse off without in any way favoring equality of any sort for its own sake.
Of course, in other cases desert principles as described will have inegalitarian implications. If a sinner already has little by way of good fortune, but more than she deserves, and a saint has a lot, but less than she deserves, bringing about the state of affairs in which the worse off sinner has even less than she presently has and the already better off saint gets even more is recommended by desert principles. The point is simply that egalitarianism in the broad sense, a policy that favors transfers of resources from the better off to the worse off in some circumstances, will be justified by a variety of moral principles. These contingently egalitarian principles may have no tendency whatsoever to generate support for the norm that equality is per se desirable--that it is in itself bad if some are worse off than others.
To defend the position that equality is per se morally desirable one would need carefully to investigate the scenarios in which egalitarian transfers are attractive and the variety of principles that would support egalitarian transfers in those scenarios. If the norm of equality does not match our considered judgments after wide reflection, we should be content to be instrumental egalitarians if we are determined to be egalitarians at all.
Bibliography
- Anderson, Elizabeth, 1999, "What Is the Point of Equality?", Ethics 109, pp. 287-337.
- Arneson, Richard J., 1989, "Equality and Equal Opportunity for Welfare," Philosophical Studies 56, pp. 77-93, reprinted in Louis Pojman and Robert Westmoreland (eds.), Equality: Selected Readings, Oxford: Oxford University Press 1997, pp. 229-241.
- Arneson, Richard J., 2000, "Welfare Should Be the Currency of Justice," Canadian Journal of Philosophy 30, pp. 477-524.
- Barry, Brian, 2001, Culture and Equality, Cambridge and London: Harvard University Press.
- Buchanan, Allen, Brock, Dan W., Daniels, Norman, and Wikler, Daniel, 2000, From Chance to Choice: Genetics and Justice, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, chapters 3 and 4.
- Christiano, Thomas, 1996, The Rule of the Many, Boulder, Colorado: Westview Press.
- Cohen G. A., 1988, History, Labour, and Freedom: Themes from Marx, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Cohen, G. A., 1989, "On the Currency of Egalitarian Justice, Ethics 99, pp. 906-944.
- Cohen, G. A., 1995, Self-Ownership, Freedom, and Equality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Cohen, Joshua, 1989, "Democratic Equality", Ethics 99, pp. 727-751.
- Cohen, Joshua, 1989 a, "Deliberative Democracy," in Alan Hamlin and Philip Pettit (eds.), The Good Polity, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- Daniels, Norman, 1990, "Equality of What? Welfare, Resources, or Capabilities?", Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 50 (supp. vol.), pp. 273-296.
- Dworkin, Ronald, 2000, Sovereign Virtue: Equality in Theory and Practice, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Estlund, David, 2000, "Political Quality," Social Philosophy and Policy 17, pp. 127-160.
- Fishkin, James, 1983, Justice, Equal Opportunity, and the Family, New Haven: Yale University Press.
- Fleurbaey, Marc, 1995, "Equal Opportunity or Equal Social Outcome?", Economics and Philosophy 11, pp. 25-55.
- Frankfurt, Harry, 1987, "Equality as a Moral Ideal," Ethics 98, pp. 21-42, reprinted in Frankfurt, Harry, 1988, The Importance of What We Care About, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Griffin, James, 1986, Well-Being: Its Meaning, Measurement, and Moral Importance, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Hare, R.M., 1981, Moral Thinking: Its Levels, Method, and Point, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Hurka, Thomas, 1993, Perfectionism, New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Kagan, Shelly, "Equality and Desert," in Louis P. Pojman and Owen McLeod (eds.), What Do We Deserve? A Reader on Justice and Desert, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press, 1999, pp. 298-314.
- Larmore, Charles, 1987, Patterns of Moral Complexity, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Larmore, Charles, 1996, The Morals of Modernity, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Locke, John, 1690, Second Treatise of Government, C. B. MacPherson (ed.), Indianapolis: Hackett, 1980 edition.
- Kymlicka, Will, 1990, Contemporary Political Philosophy: An Introduction, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Kymlicka, Will, 1995, Multicultural Citizenship: A Liberal Theory of Minority Rights, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Marx, Karl, 1978. "Critique of the Gotha Program," in Robert C. Tucker (ed.), The Marx-Engels Reader, New York: W. W. Norton, pp. 525-541. (Written in 1875.)
- McKerlie, Dennis, 1989, "Equality and Time," Ethics 99, pp. 475-491.
- McKerlie, Dennis, 2001, "Justice Between the Young and the Old," Philosophy and Public Affairs 30, pp. 152-177.
- Miller, Richard W., 1998, "Cosmopolitan Respect and Patriotic Concern," Philosophy and Public Affairs 27, pp. 202-224.
- Nagel, Thomas, 1991, Equality and Partiality, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Nozick, Robert, 1974, Anarchy, State, and Utopia, New York: Basic Books.
- Nussbaum, Martha, 1990, "Aristotelian Social Democracy," in Liberalism and the Good, R. B. Douglas, Gerald M. Mara, and Henry Richardson (eds.), New York: Routledge, 1990, pp. 203-252.
- Nussbaum, Martha, 1992, "Human Functioning and Social Justice: In Defense of Aristotelian Essentialism," Political Theory 20, pp. 202-246.
- Nussbaum, Martha, 1999, "Woman and Cultural Universals," in Nussbaum, Sex and Social Justice, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 29-54.
- Nussbaum, Martha, 2000, Women and Human Development: The Capabilities Approach, cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Orwell, George, 1938, Homage to Catalonia, reprinted edition 1952, New York: Harcourt, Brace, and World.
- Parfit, Derek, 1984, Appendix I, "What Makes Someone's Life Go Best," in Parfit, Reasons and Persons, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 493-502.
- Parfit, Derek, 1997, "Equality and Priority," Ratio 10, pp. 202-221.
- Rakowski, Eric, 1992, Equal Justice, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Rawls, John, 1971, A Theory of Justice, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, rev. ed. 1999.
- Rawls, John, 1993, Political Liberalism, New York: Columbia University Press.
- Rawls, John, 1999, Collected Papers, Samuel Freeman (ed.), Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Rawls, John, 2001, Justice as Fairness: A Restatement, ed. by Erin Kelly, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Raz, Joseph, 1986, "Equality," in Raz, The Morality of Freedom, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Roemer, John E., 1996, Theories of Distributive Justice, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Roemer, John E., 1998, Equality of Opportunity, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Scanlon, T. M., 1997, "The Diversity of Objections to Inequality," The Lindley Lecture, Department of Philosophy, University of Kansas, reprinted in Mattthew Clayton and Andrew Williams (eds.), The Ideal of Equality, Basingstoke, Hampshire: Macmillan, and New York: St. Martin's Press, 2000, pp. 41-59.
- Schar, John, 1967, "Equality of Opportunity--and Beyond," in Pennock, J. Roland, and Chapman, John, eds., 1967, Equality: Nomos IX, New York: Atherton Press, reprinted in Pojman, Louis P., and Westmoreland, Robert, 1997, Equality: Selected Readings, New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 137-147.
- Scheffler, Samuel, 1982, The Rejection of Consequentialism, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
- Sen, Amartya, "Equality of What?", in S. McMurrin (ed.), The Tanner Lectures on Human Values, vol. 1, 1980, Salt Lake City: University of Utah Press, reprinted in Sen, 1982, Choice, Welfare and Measurement, Cambridge: MIT Press, pp. 353-369.
- Sen, Amartya, 1992, Inequality Reexamined, Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
- Sen, Amartya, 1997, On Economic Inequality, expanded edition with annexe by Foster, James E., and Sen, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Sher, George, 1997, Beyond Neutrality: Perfectionism and Politics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Steiner, Hillel, 1994, An Essay on Rights, Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- Temkin, Larry S., 1993, Inequality, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
- Vallentyne, Peter, and Steiner, Hillel, 2000, The Origins of Left-Libertarianism: An Anthology of Historical Writings, Basingstoke, Hampshire, and New York: Palgrave.
- Vallentyne, Peter, and Steiner, Hillel, Left-Libertarianism and Its Critics: The Contemporary Debate, Basingstoke, Hampshire, and New York: Palgrave.
- Van Parijs, Philippe, 1995, Real Freedom for All: What (if Anything) Can Justify Capitalism?, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
- Walzer, Michael, 1983, Spheres of Justice: A Defense of Pluralism and Equality, New York: Basic Books.
- Weirich, Paul, 1983, "Utility Tempered with Equality," Nous 17, pp. 423-39.
- Wolff, Jonathan, 1998, "Fairness, Respect, and the Egalitarian Ethos," Philosophy and Public Affairs 27, pp. 97-122.
- Wood, Allen, 1981 Karl Marx, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, chapters 9 and 10.
- Young, Iris Marion, 1990, Justice and the Politics of Difference, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Other Internet Resources
- Equality and Responsibility, Boston Review, April/May 1995 issue, Vol. XX No. 2.
Related Entries
equality | equality: of opportunity | justice: distributive | luck: justice and bad luck