Environmental Aesthetics
Environmental aesthetics is a relatively new sub-field of philosophical aesthetics. It arose within analytic aesthetics in the last third of the twentieth century. Prior to its emergence, aesthetics within the analytic tradition it was largely concerned with the philosophy of art. Environmental aesthetics originated as a reaction to this emphasis, pursuing instead the investigation of the aesthetic appreciation of natural environments. Since its early stages, the scope of environmental aesthetics has broadened to include not simply natural environments but also human and human-influenced ones. At the same time, the discipline has also come to include the examination of that which falls within such environments, giving rise to what is called the aesthetics of everyday life. This area involves the aesthetics of not only more common objects and environments, but also a range of everyday activities. Thus, early in the twenty-first century, environmental aesthetics embraces the study of the aesthetic significance of almost everything other than art.
- 1. History
- 2. Twentieth Century Developments
- 3. Current Positions in Environmental Aesthetics
- 4. Recent Developments in Environmental Aesthetics
- Bibliography
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. History
Although environmental aesthetics has developed as a sub-field of philosophical aesthetics only in the last thirty-five years, it has historical roots in eighteenth and nineteenth century aesthetics. In these centuries, there were important advances in the aesthetics of nature, including the emergence of the concepts of disinterestedness and the picturesque, as well as the introduction of the idea of positive aesthetics. These notions continue to play a role in contemporary work in environmental aesthetics, especially in the context of its relationship to environmentalism.
1.1 Eighteenth Century Aesthetics of Nature
The first major philosophical developments in the aesthetics of nature occurred in the eighteenth century. During that century, the founders of modern aesthetics not only began to take nature rather than art as the paradigmatic object of aesthetic experience, they also developed the concept of disinterestedness as the mark of such experience. Over the course of the century, this concept was elaborated by various thinkers, who employed it to purge from aesthetic appreciation an ever-increasing range of interests and associations. According to one standard account (Stolnitz 1961), the concept originated with the third earl of Shaftesbury, who introduced it as a way of characterizing the notion of the aesthetic, was embellished by Francis Hutcheson, who expanded it so as to exclude from aesthetic experience not simply personal and utilitarian interests, but also associations of a more general nature, and was further developed by Archibald Alison, who took it to refer to a particular state of mind. The concept was given its classic formulation in Immanuel Kant's Critique of Judgment, in which nature was taken as an exemplary object of aesthetic experience. Kant argued that natural beauty was superior to that of art and that it complemented the best habits of mind. It is no accident that the development of the concept of disinterestedness and the acceptance of nature as an ideal object of aesthetic appreciation went hand in hand. The clarification of the notion of the aesthetic in terms of the concept of disinterestedness disassociated the aesthetic appreciation of nature from the appreciator's particular personal, religious, economic, or utilitarian interests, any of which could impede aesthetic experience.
The theory of disinterestedness also provided groundwork for understanding the aesthetic dimensions of nature in terms of three distinct conceptualizations. The first involved the idea of the beautiful, which readily applies to tamed and cultivated European gardens and landscapes. The second centered on the idea of the sublime. In the experience of the sublime, the more threatening and terrifying of nature's manifestations, such as mountains and wilderness, when viewed with disinterestedness, can be aesthetically appreciated, rather than simply feared or despised. These two notions were importantly elaborated by Edmund Burke and Kant. However, concerning the appreciation of nature, a third concept was to become more significant than that of either the beautiful or the sublime: the notion of the picturesque. Thus, by the end of the eighteenth century, there were three clearly distinct ideas each focusing on different aspects of nature's diverse and often contrasting moods. John Conron (2000, 17-18), an historian of the theory of the picturesque, argues that: “In eighteenth-century English theory, the boundaries between aesthetic categories are relatively clear and stable”. He summarizes the differences as follows: beautiful objects tend to be small and smooth, but subtly varied, delicate, and “fair” in color, while that which is sublime, by contrast, is powerful, vast, intense, terrifying, and “definitionless”. Picturesque items are typically in the middle ground between those which are sublime or beautiful, being complex and eccentric, varied and irregular, rich and forceful, and vibrant with energy.
It is not surprising that of these three notions, the idea of the picturesque, rather that of the beautiful or the sublime, achieved the greatest prominence concerning the aesthetic experience of nature. Not only does it occupy the extensive middle ground of, in Conron's words, the complex, irregular, forceful, and vibrant, all of which abound in the natural world, it also reinforced various long-standing connections between the aesthetic appreciation of nature and the treatment of nature in art. The term “picturesque” literally means “picture-like” and the theory of the picturesque advocates aesthetic appreciation in which the natural world is experienced as if divided into art-like scenes, which ideally resemble works of arts, especially landscape painting, in both subject matter and composition. Thus, since the concept of disinterestedness mandated appreciation of nature stripped of the appreciator's own personal interests and associations, it helped to clear the ground for experience of nature governed by the theory of the picturesque, by which the appreciator is encouraged to see nature in terms of a new set of artistic images and associations. In this way the idea of the picturesque relates to earlier conceptions of the natural world as comprised of what were called “the works of nature”, which, although considered proper and important objects of aesthetic experience, were thought to be more appealing when they resembled works of art. The idea also resonates with other artistic traditions, such as that of viewing art as the mirror of nature. The theory of the picturesque received its fullest treatment in the late eighteenth century when it was popularized in the writings of William Gilpin, Uvedale Price, and Richard Payne Knight. At that time, it provided an aesthetic ideal for English tourists, who pursued picturesque scenery in the Lake District, the Scottish Highlands, and the Alps.
1.2 Nineteenth Century Aesthetics of Nature
Following its articulation in the eighteenth century, the idea of the picturesque remained a dominant influence on popular aesthetic experience of nature throughout the entire nineteenth and well into the twentieth century. Indeed, it is still an important component of the kind of aesthetic experience commonly associated with ordinary tourism—that which involves seeing and appreciating the natural world as it is represented in the depictions found in travel brochures, calendar photos, and picture postcards. However, while the idea of the picturesque continued to guide popular aesthetic appreciation of nature, the philosophical study of the aesthetics of nature, after flowering in the eighteenth century, went into steady decline. Many of the main themes, such as the concept of the sublime, the notion of disinterestedness, and the theoretical centrality of nature rather than art, culminated with Kant, who gave some of these ideas such exhaustive treatment that a kind of philosophical closure was seemingly achieved. Following Kant, a new world order was initiated by Hegel. In Hegel's philosophy, art was the highest expression of “Absolute Spirit”, and it rather than nature was destined to become the favored subject of philosophical aesthetics. Thus, in the wake of Hegel the theoretical study of the aesthetics of nature almost came to an end. In the nineteenth century, both on the continent and in the United Kingdom, only a few philosophers and a scattering of thinkers of the Romantic Movement seriously treated the aesthetic experience of nature. There was no theoretical work comparable to that of the preceding century.
However, as the philosophical study of the aesthetics of nature languished in Europe, a new way of understanding the aesthetic appreciation of the natural world was developing in North America. This conception of nature appreciation had its roots in the American tradition of nature writing, as exemplified in the essays of Henry David Thoreau. It was initially influenced by the idea of the picturesque, especially in its artistic manifestations, such as the paintings of Thomas Cole and his pupil Frederick Edwin Church. However, as nature writing became its more dominant form of expression, the conception was increasingly shaped by developments in the natural sciences. In the middle of the nineteenth century, it was further influenced by the geographical work of George Perkins Marsh, who argued that humanity was increasingly causing the destruction of the beauty of nature. The idea was most forcefully presented toward the end of the century in the work of American naturalist John Muir, who was steeped in natural history. Muir explicitly distinguished this kind of understanding of aesthetic appreciation from that governed by the idea of the picturesque. In a well-known essay, “A Near View of the High Sierra” (1894), two of Muir's artist companions, who focus exclusively on mountain scenery, exemplify aesthetic experience of nature as guided by the idea of the picturesque. This is contrasted with Muir's own aesthetic experience, which involved an interest in and appreciation of the mountain environment akin to that of a geologist. This sort of approach to experiencing nature eventually brought Muir to see the whole of the natural environment and especially wild nature as aesthetically beautiful and to find ugliness only where nature was subject to human intrusion. The range of things that he regarded as aesthetically appreciable seemed to encompass the entire natural world, from creatures considered hideous in his day, such as snakes and alligators, to natural disasters thought to ruin the environment, such as floods and earthquakes. The kind of nature appreciation practiced by Muir has become associated with the contemporary point of view called “positive aesthetics” (Carlson 1984). Insofar as such appreciation eschews humanity's marks on the natural environment, it is somewhat the converse of aesthetic appreciation influenced by the idea of the picturesque, which finds interest and delight in evidence of human presence.
2. Twentieth Century Developments
The philosophical study of the aesthetics of the natural world reached its lowest point in the middle of the twentieth century, with the almost exclusive focus of analytic aesthetics on the philosophy of art. At the same time the view that the aesthetic appreciation of nature is totally parasitic upon that of art, and even the idea that it is simply not aesthetic appreciation at all, were also defended by some thinkers. However, in the last third of the century, there was a reaction to the neglect of the natural world by the discipline of aesthetics, which initiated the recent revival of the aesthetic investigation of nature and eventually led to other contemporary developments in environmental aesthetics.
2.1 The Neglect of the Aesthetics of Nature
In the first half of the twentieth century, philosophy largely ignored the aesthetics of nature. However, there were some noteworthy exceptions. For example, in North America, George Santayana investigated the topic as well as the concept of nature itself. Somewhat later, John Dewey contributed to the understanding of the aesthetic experience of both nature and everyday life, and Curt Ducasse discussed the beauty of nature as well as that of the human form. In England, R. G. Collingwood worked on both the philosophy of art and the idea of nature, but the two topics did not importantly come together in his thought. However, other than a few such individuals, as far as aesthetics was pursued, no one seriously considered the aesthetics of nature. On the contrary, the discipline was completely dominated by an interest in art. By the mid-twentieth century, within analytic philosophy, the principal philosophical school in the English-speaking world at that time, philosophical aesthetics was virtually equated with philosophy of art. The leading aesthetics textbook of the period was subtitled Problems in the Philosophy of Criticism and opened with the assertion: “There would be no problems of aesthetics, in the sense in which I propose to mark out this field of study, if no one ever talked about works of art” (Beardsley 1958, 1). The comment was meant to emphasize the importance of the analysis of language, but it also reveals the art-dominated construal of aesthetics of that time. Moreover, if and when the aesthetic appreciation of nature was discussed, it was treated, by comparison with that of art, as a messy, subjective business of less philosophical interest. Some of the major aestheticians of the second half of the century argued that aesthetic judgments beyond what became known as the “artworld” must remain relative to conditions of observation and unfettered by the kind of constraints that govern the appreciation of art (Walton 1970, Dickie 1974, 169-199).
The domination of the discipline of aesthetics by an interest in art had two ramifications: On the one hand, it helped to motivate a controversial philosophical position that denied the possibility of any aesthetic experience of nature whatsoever. The position held that aesthetic appreciation necessarily involves aesthetic judgments, which entail judging the object of appreciation as the achievement of a designing intellect. However, since nature is not the product of a designing intellect, its appreciation is not aesthetic. According to this view, in the past nature appreciation was deemed aesthetic because of the assumption that nature is the work of a designing creator, but this assumption is simply false or at least inadequate for grounding an aesthetics of nature (Mannison 1980). On the other hand, the art-dominated construal of aesthetics also gave support to approaches that stand within the many different historical traditions that conceptualize the natural world as essentially art-like—for example, as a set of “works of nature”, or as the “handiwork” of a creator, or as picturesque scenery. For example, what might be called a landscape model of nature appreciation, which stems directly from the tradition of the picturesque, proposes that we should aesthetically experience nature as we appreciate landscape paintings. This requires seeing it to some extent as if it were a series of two-dimensional scenes and focusing either on formal aesthetic qualities or on artistic qualities dependent upon the kind of romantic images associated with the idea of the picturesque. Such art-oriented models of the aesthetic appreciation of nature, in addition to being supported by powerful and long-standing traditions of thought (Biese 1905, Nicolson 1959), are defended in some recent work in environmental aesthetics (Stecker 1997, Crawford 2004, Leddy 2005). Likewise, the defense of formal aesthetic appreciation of nature has recently been renewed (Zangwill 2001).
However, although both the idea that nature appreciation is not aesthetic and the art-oriented approaches find some grounding in analytic aesthetics' reduction of aesthetics to philosophy of art, they are thought by some philosophers to be deeply counterintuitive. Concerning the former, many of our fundamental paradigms of aesthetic experience seem to be instances of appreciation of nature, such as our delight in a sunset or a bird in flight. Moreover, the Western tradition in aesthetics, as well as other traditions, such as the Japanese, has long been committed to a doctrine that explicitly contradict the nonaesthetic conception of nature appreciation: the conviction that, as one philosopher expresses it, anything that can be viewed can be viewed aesthetically (Ziff 1979). Concerning the art-oriented models, it is argued by some that such approaches do not fully realize serious, appropriate appreciation of nature, but rather distort the true character of natural environments. For example, the landscape model recommends framing and flattening environments into scenery. Moreover, in focusing heavily on artistic qualities, these accounts are thought to neglect much of our normal experience and understanding of nature (Hepburn 1966, Carlson 1979a 1979b, Saito 1998b). The problem, in short, is that they do not acknowledge the importance of aesthetically appreciating nature, as a leading aesthetician puts it, “as nature” (Budd 2002, 91). However, many of these criticisms of art-oriented appreciation, such as that dictated by the idea of the picturesque, did not come to a head until contemporary environmental philosophers and environmentalists began to look more seriously to environmental aesthetics for guidance concerning the conservation and protection of both natural and human environments (see section 4.2).
2.2 The Emergence of Environmental Aesthetics
In the last third of the twentieth century, a renewed interest in the aesthetics of nature emerged. This revival was the result of several different factors. In part, it was a natural response to the growing public concern about the apparent degeneration of the environment, aesthetic and otherwise. It was also the result of the academic world becoming aware of the significance of the environmental movement—at the level of both theoretical discussion and practical action. It is noteworthy that the emergence of the philosophical study of environmental ethics also dates from this time. Some of the earlier work in environmental aesthetics focused on empirical research conducted in response to public apprehension about the aesthetic state of the environment. Critics argued that the landscape assessment and planning techniques used in environmental management were inadequate in stressing mainly formal qualities, while overlooking expressive and other kinds of aesthetic qualities (Sagoff 1974, Carlson, 1976). Empirical approaches were also faulted for being fixated on “scenic beauty” and unduly influenced by ideas such as that of the picturesque (Carlson 1977 1979b). These and other problems were attributed to the lack of an adequate theoretical framework; research was said to be conducted in a “theoretical vacuum” (Appleton 1975b). Attempts to fill this vacuum prompted the idea of sociobiological underpinnings for the aesthetic appreciation of nature, such as “prospect-refuge theory” (Appleton 1975a) as well as other evolution-related accounts (Orians and Heerwagen 1986 1992). In addition, the concerns of this period motivated the development of a variety of theoretical models of aesthetic response grounded in, for example, developmental and environmental psychology (Kaplan and Kaplan 1989, Bourassa 1991). There are overviews (Zube 1984, Cats-Baril and Gibson 1986, Daniel, 2001) and collections (Saarinen et al 1984, Nasar 1988, Sheppard and Harshaw 2001) of this and related kinds of research, as well as more recent studies that have an essentially empirical orientation (Porteous 1996, Bell 1999).
Within philosophical aesthetics itself, the renewed interested in the aesthetics of nature was also fueled by another development: the publication of Ronald Hepburn's seminal article “Contemporary Aesthetics and the Neglect of Natural Beauty” (1966). Hepburn's essay helped to set the agenda for the aesthetics of nature in the late twentieth century. After noting that by essentially reducing all of aesthetics to philosophy of art, analytic aesthetics had virtually ignored the natural world, Hepburn argued that aesthetic appreciation of art frequently provides misleading models for the appreciation of nature. However, he nonetheless observed that there is in the aesthetic appreciation of nature, as in the appreciation of art, a distinction between appreciation that is only trivial and superficial and that which is serious and deep. He furthermore suggested that for nature such serious appreciation may require new and different approaches that can accommodate not only nature's indeterminate and varying character, but also both our multi-sensory experience and our diverse understanding of it. By focusing attention on natural beauty, Hepburn demonstrated that there could be significant philosophical investigation of the aesthetic experience of the world beyond the artworld. He thereby not only generated renewed interest in the aesthetics of nature, he also laid foundations for environmental aesthetics in general as well as for the aesthetics of everyday life.
3. Current Positions in Environmental Aesthetics
The contemporary positions in environmental aesthetics have developed from different points of views concerning the aesthetic appreciation of the natural environment. These are frequently divided into two camps, alternatively labeled cognitive and non-cognitive (Godlovitch 1994, Eaton 1998, Carlson and Berleant 2004), conceptual and non-conceptual (Moore 1999 2008), or narrative and ambient (Foster 1998). Within each camp several distinct positions have emerged.
3.1 Cognitive Views
What are called cognitive (conceptual or narrative) positions in environmental aesthetics are united by the thought that knowledge and information about the nature of the object of appreciation is central to its aesthetic appreciation. Thus, they champion the idea that nature must be appreciated, as one author puts it, “on its own terms” (Saito 1998b, 135). These positions tend to reject aesthetic approaches to environments, such as that governed by the idea of the picturesque, that draw heavily on the aesthetic experience of art for modeling the appreciation of nature. Yet they affirm that art appreciation can nonetheless show some of what is required in an adequate account of nature appreciation. For example, in serious, appropriate aesthetic appreciation of works of art, it is taken to be essential that we experience works as what they in fact are and in light of knowledge of their real natures. Thus, for instance, appropriate appreciation of a work such as Picasso's Guernica (1937) requires that we experience it as a painting and moreover as a cubist painting, and therefore that we appreciate it in light of our knowledge of paintings in general and of cubist paintings in particular (Walton 1970). Adopting this general line of thought, one cognitive approach to nature appreciation, sometimes labeled the natural environmental model (Carlson 1979a) or scientific cognitivism (Parsons 2002), holds that just as serious, appropriate aesthetic appreciation of art requires knowledge of art history and art criticism, such aesthetic appreciation of nature requires knowledge of natural history—the knowledge provided by the natural sciences and especially sciences such as geology, biology, and ecology. The idea is that scientific knowledge about nature can reveal the actual aesthetic qualities of natural objects and environments in the way in which knowledge about art history and art criticism can for works of art. In short, to appropriately aesthetically appreciate nature “on its own terms” is to appreciate it as it is characterized by natural science (Carlson 1979a 1981 2000 2007 2008, Part I, Rolston 1995, Eaton 1998, Matthews 2002, Parsons 2002 2006b 2008).
Other cognitive or quasi-cognitive accounts of the aesthetic appreciation of environments differ from scientific cognitivism concerning either the kind of cognitive resources taken to be relevant to such appreciation or the degree to which these resources are considered relevant. On the one hand, several cognitive approaches emphasize different kinds of information, claiming that appreciating nature “on its own terms” may well involve experiencing it in light of various cultural and historical traditions. Thus, in appropriate aesthetic appreciation, local and regional narratives, folklore, and even mythological stories about nature are endorsed either as complementary with or as alternative to scientific knowledge (Sepänmaa 1993, Saito 1998b, Heyd 2001). On the other hand, another at least quasi-cognitive approach strongly supports the idea that nature must be appreciated “as nature”, but does not go beyond that constraint. The justification for accepting the “as nature” restriction is that the aesthetic experience of nature should be true to what nature actually is. This, however, is the extent of the position's commitment to cognitivism and marks the limits of the similarity that it finds between art appreciation and the appreciation of nature. It rejects the idea that scientific knowledge about nature can reveal the actual aesthetic qualities of natural objects and environments in the way in which knowledge about art history and art criticism can for works of art. Moreover, it holds that, unlike the case with art, many of the most significant aesthetic dimensions of natural objects and environments are extremely relative to conditions of observation. The upshot is that aesthetic appreciation of nature is taken to allow a degree of freedom that is denied to the aesthetic appreciation of art (Fisher 1998, Budd 2002, Chapters 3-4).
3.2 Non-cognitive Views
Standing in contrast to the cognitive positions in environmental aesthetics are several so-called non-cognitive (non-conceptual or ambient) approaches. However, “non-cognitive” here should not be taken in its older philosophical sense, as meaning primarily or only “emotive”. Rather it indicates simply that these views hold that something other than a cognitive component, such as scientific knowledge or cultural tradition, is the central feature of the aesthetic appreciation of environments. The leading non-cognitive approach, often called the aesthetics of engagement, rejects many of the traditional ideas about aesthetic appreciation not only for nature but also for art. It argues that the theory of disinterestedness involves a mistaken analysis of concept of the aesthetic and that this is most evident in the aesthetic experience of natural environments. According to the engagement approach, disinterested appreciation, with its isolating, distancing, and objectifying gaze, is out of place in the aesthetic experience of nature, for it wrongly abstracts both natural objects and appreciators from the environments in which they properly belong and in which appropriate appreciation is achieved. Thus, the aesthetics of engagement stresses the contextual dimensions of nature and our multi-sensory experience of it. Viewing the environment as a seamless unity of places, organisms, and perceptions, it challenges the importance of traditional dichotomies, such as that between subject and object. It beckons appreciators to immerse themselves in the natural environment and to reduce to as small a degree as possible the distance between themselves and the natural world. In short, appropriate aesthetic experience is held to involve the total immersion of the appreciator in the object of appreciation (Berleant 1992 1997 2005, Part I).
Other non-cognitive positions in environmental aesthetics contend that dimensions other than engagement are central to aesthetic experience. What is known as the arousal model holds that we may appreciate nature simply by opening ourselves to it and being emotionally aroused by it. On this view, a less intellectual, more visceral experience of nature of this sort constitutes a legitimate way of aesthetically appreciating it that does not require any knowledge gained from science or elsewhere (Carroll 1993). Another alternative similarly argues that neither scientific nor any other kind of knowledge facilitates real, appropriate appreciation of nature, but not because such appreciation need involve only emotional arousal, but rather because nature itself is essentially alien, aloof, distant, and unknowable. This position, which may be called the mystery model, contends that appropriate experience of nature incorporates a sense of being separate from nature and of not belonging to it—a sense of mystery involving a state of appreciative incomprehension (Godlovitch 1994). A fourth non-cognitive approach brings together several features thought to be relevant to nature appreciation. It attempts to balance engagement and the traditional idea of disinterestedness, while giving center stage to imagination. This position distinguishes a number of different kinds of imagination—associative, metaphorical, exploratory, projective, ampliative, and revelatory. It also responds to concerns that imagination introduces subjectivity, by appealing to factors such as guidance by the object of appreciation, the constraining role of disinterestedness, and the notion of “imagining well” (Brady 1998, 145-146, 2003). A related point of view, which stresses the metaphysical dimensions of imagination, might also be placed in the non-cognitive camp, although doing so requires making certain assumptions about the cognitive content of metaphysical speculation. According to this account, the imagination interprets nature as revealing metaphysical insights: insights about things such as the meaning of life, the human condition, or our place in the cosmos. Thus, this position includes within appropriate aesthetic experience of nature those abstract meditations and ruminations about ultimate reality that our encounters with nature sometimes engender (Hepburn 1996).
4. Recent Developments in Environmental Aesthetics
Recently, the various cognitive and non-cognitive approaches in environmental aesthetics have expanded from their initial focus on natural environments to consider human and human-influenced environments and developed such as to include an aesthetic investigation of everyday life in general. At the same time, the relationship between environmental aesthetics and environmentalism has been increasingly scrutinized, resulting in extensive criticism of earlier work in the aesthetics of nature as well as detailed assessments of the current positions (Carlson and Lintott 2007, Parsons 2008). Concerning both the aesthetics of human environments and environmentalism, approaches that combine the resources of both cognitive and non-cognitive points of views seem especially fruitful.
4.1 The Aesthetics of Human Environments and Everyday Life
Both the cognitive and the non-cognitive camps in environmental aesthetics have resources that may be brought to bear on the aesthetic investigation of human and human-influenced environments as well as everyday life in general. Cognitive accounts hold that appropriate aesthetic appreciation of human environments, like that of natural environments, depends on knowledge of what something is, what it is like, and why it is as it is. Thus, for human-influenced environments such as, for example, the landscapes of agriculture or industry, what is relevant to appropriate appreciation is information about their histories, their functions, and their roles in our lives (Carlson 1985 2008, Parsons and Carlson 2008). The same holds for other human and human-influenced environments, both rural and urban (Carlson 2001b 2006a 2008). Some cognitively-oriented accounts also stress, as they do in the case of natural environments, the aesthetic potential of cultural traditions in the aesthetic experience of human environments. Such traditions seem especially relevant to the appreciation of what might be termed cultural landscapes—environments that constitute important places in the cultures and histories of particular groups of people. What is often called a sense of place, together with ideas and images from folklore, mythology, and religion, frequently plays a significant role in individuals' aesthetic experience of their own home landscapes (Saito 1985, Tuan 1993, Sepänmaa 1993, Carlson 2000, Chapter 14 2008). The non-cognitive approaches to environmental aesthetics also provide several channels for exploring the aesthetics of human and human-influenced environments and especially for pursuing the aesthetics of everyday life. The engagement view is presented as a model for the aesthetic appreciation of not simply both nature and art, but also just about everything else; it studies the aesthetic dimensions of small towns, large cities, theme parks, museums (Berleant 1992 1997 2005, Part I), and even human relationships (Berleant 2005, Part II). Likewise, accounts that emphasize imagination help us to understand our aesthetic responses to everything from our exploitation of environments to our smelling and tasting of them (Brady 2003 2005).
Fruitful approaches to the aesthetic appreciation of human environments as well as to other aspects of everyday life also can be found in views that draw on features of both the cognitive and the non-cognitive camps. There have been several attempts to forge connections between the two orientations (Foster 1998, Moore 1999 2008, Berleant and Carlson 2007). Moreover, there are numerous studies that, without being totally either cognitive or non-cognitive, inform our understanding of the appreciation of human environments, such as rural countrysides (Andrews 2007) and urban cityscapes (von Bonsdorff 2002, Macauley 2007) as well as more specialized environments, such as the shopping center (Brottman 2007). Beyond the consideration of these large, public environments, the aesthetics of everyday life becomes especially relevant. It investigates not only the aesthetic qualities of smaller, more personal environments, such as individual living spaces, for example, yards and houses (Melchionne 1998 2002), but also the aesthetic dimensions of normal day-to-day experiences (Leddy 1995 2005, Saito 2001 2007a, Haapala 2005) as well as everyday activities such as playing sports (Welsch 2005) and dining (Korsmeyer 1999, Brady 2005, Kuehn 2005). (Recent collections focusing on this kind of research include Haapala 1998, von Bonsdorff and Haapala 1999, Light and Smith 2005.) With the aesthetic investigation of things such as sports and food, the aesthetics of everyday life begins to come full circle, connecting environmental aesthetics back to the edges of more traditional aesthetics. At this point, environmental aesthetics makes contact with the philosophy of borderline art forms, not only the “arts” of sport and cuisine, but also the art of gardening (Miller 1993, Ross 1998, Cooper 2006) and the arts of landscaping, planning, and building (Carlson 2000, Chapter 13, 2006a, Stecker 1999). In addition, but now within the context of environmental aesthetics, traditional art forms, such as poetry and literature (Ross 1998, Chapter 3, Carlson 2000, Chapter 14, Sepänmaa 2004) and painting, sculpture, dance, and music (Berleant 1991, Part II, Ross 1998, Chapter 4) as well as newer forms, such as film (Berleant 1991, Part III, Sitney 1993) and environmental art (Crawford 1983, Carlson 1986, Ross 1993), are explored and re-explored—both as aesthetically significant dimensions of our everyday experiences and concerning their roles in shaping aesthetic appreciation of both natural and human environments.
4.2 Environmental Aesthetics and Environmentalism
The relationships between environmentalism and the positions and ideas of environmental aesthetics have sources in the aesthetics of nature developed in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries. Thus, in the nineteenth and early twentieth century, appreciation of and concern for the environment in both Europe and North American were fostered by picturesque-influenced tourism that was grounded in eighteenth century aesthetics of nature (Rees 1975). Moreover, the early environmental movements, especially in North America, were largely fueled by a mode of aesthetic appreciation shaped not only by the notion of the picturesque but also by the ideas (which have become central in contemporary positive aesthetics) developed by thinkers such as Muir (Hargrove 1979, Callicott 1994). However, more recently the relationships between environmental aesthetics and environmentalism have been less congenial. Individuals interested in the conservation and protection of both natural and human heritage environments have not found in traditional aesthetics of nature the resources that they believe they need in order to carry our an environmentalist agenda. The problem is especially acute concerning environments, such as wetlands, that do not fit conventional conceptions of scenic beauty (Rolston 2000, Callicott 2003). In line with earlier criticisms that much of the empirical work in landscape assessment and planning was focused only on scenic, picturesque environments (Carlson 1977 1979b), much of the historical tradition concerning the aesthetic appreciation of nature has come under attack. Various themes in the aesthetics of nature, such as appreciation grounded in the idea of the picturesque, have been criticized in a number of ways: as anthropocentric (Godlovitch 1994), scenery-obsessed (Saito 1998a), trivial (Callicott 1994), subjective (Thompson 1995), and/or morally vacuous (Andrews 1998, 59). Similarly, in agreement with the aesthetics of engagement's critique of the theory of disinterestedness (Berleant 1991 1992), some find that concept to be equally questionable from an environmental standpoint (Callicott 1994).
There are a variety of responses to these kinds of criticisms of traditional aesthetics of nature and of the notions of disinterestedness and the picturesque. Some philosophers argue that, although the idea of the picturesque may indeed be questionable, the theory of disinterestedness is yet essential, since without it the notion of the aesthetic itself lacks conceptual grounding (Carlson 1993, Budd 2002, 111-112). Moreover, others claim that an analysis of aesthetic experience in terms of the concept of disinterestedness helps to meet the charges that traditional aesthetics is anthropocentric and subjective, since such an analysis supports the objectivity of aesthetic judgments (Brady 2003). The charge of anthropocentricity is explicitly addressed by the mystery approach, which attempts to give aesthetic appreciation of nature an “acentric” basis (Godlovitch 1994). Similarly, the resources of other non-cognitive positions, especially the aesthetics of engagement, are taken to counter the criticism that, due to the influence of ideas such as that of the picturesque, aesthetic experience of nature must be both anthropocentric and scenery-obsessed (Rolston 1998 2002). The cognitive accounts also furnish replies to some of these charges. Scientific cognitivism in particular, with its focus on scientific knowledge, is claimed to help meet the worry that aesthetic appreciation of environments is of little significance in environmental conservation and protection since it is trivial and subjective (Parsons 2006a 2008, Hettinger 2005 2007). Moreover, this kind of view is interpreted as an “ecological aesthetic” in the tradition of Aldo Leopold, who linked the beauty of nature to ecological integrity and stability (Callicott 1994). Thus, it is endorsed by environmental philosophers who are concerned to bring our aesthetic appreciation of environments, both natural and human, in line with our environmental and moral responsibilities to maintain ecological health (Rolston 1995 2002, Eaton 1997a 1997b 1998, Saito 1998b, Lintott 2006). In this sense it also speaks to the charge that traditional aesthetic appreciation is morally vacuous.
Unlike that of the picturesque, the historical tradition that connects the aesthetic appreciation of nature with positive aesthetics has been embraced by some environmental philosophers (Rolston 1988, Chapter 6, Hargrove 1989, Chapter 6, Carlson 2006b). Moreover, the contention that untouched, pristine nature has only or primarily positive aesthetic qualities has been related to scientific cognitivism. Some suggest that linking the appreciation of nature to scientific knowledge explains how positive aesthetic appreciation is nurtured by a scientific worldview that increasingly interprets the natural world as having positive aesthetic qualities, such as order, balance, unity, and harmony (Carlson 1984). Other philosophers see the relationship between scientific cognitivism and positive aesthetics somewhat conversely, arguing that the latter should simply be assumed, in which case it provides support for the former (Parsons 2002). However, several aestheticians and environmental philosophers find positive aesthetics generally problematic, either since it appears to undercut the possibility of the kind of comparative assessments necessary for environmental planning and protection (Thompson 1995, Godlovitch 1998a) or because the idea itself seems unintuitive, obscure, and/or inadequately justified (Saito 1998a, Godlovitch 1998b, Budd 2002, Chapters 2-4). In light of this kind of uncertainty and debate, at least from the point of view of environmentalism, perhaps the proposals most useful for supporting conservation and protection of all kinds of environments are those that depend not simply on any one particular model of aesthetic appreciation, but rather attempt to constructively bring together the resources of several different positions (Eaton 1997a, Nassauer 1997, Carlson 2001a 2008, Lintott 2006, Moore 2008). For example, there are efforts to combine elements of cognitive accounts with non-cognitive points of view, such as imagination-based accounts (Fudge 2001, Ross 2005) or the aesthetics of engagement (Rolston 1998 2002, Saito 2007b). Such research points the way toward innovative, eclectic approaches in environmental aesthetics that may be the most successful in furthering a wide range of environmentalist goals and practices.
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Other Internet Resources
- Aesthetics on-line, maintained by the American Society for Aesthetics.
- Teaching Environmental Aesthetics, by Allen Carlson, at the Aesthetics on-line website
Related Entries
aesthetics: British, in the 18th century | Dewey, John: aesthetics | ethics: environmental