Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Folk Psychology as a Theory

First published Mon Sep 22, 1997; substantive revision Mon Feb 23, 2004

Many philosophers and cognitive scientists claim that our everyday or "folk" understanding of mental states constitutes a theory of mind. That theory is widely called "folk psychology" (sometimes "commonsense" psychology). The terms in which folk psychology is couched are the familiar ones of "belief" and "desire", "hunger", "pain" and so forth. According to many theorists, folk psychology plays a central role in our capacity to predict and explain the behavior of ourselves and others. However, the nature and status of folk psychology remains controversial.

1. Historical Background

One important source of the idea that our everyday understanding of mental states constitutes a folk theory of mind is Wilfred Sellars's attack on what he called "the myth of the given" (Sellars 1956). Sellars denied that the content of our mental life is simply presented to us; that is, he denied that our beliefs about our own mental states enjoy a privileged epistemic status. To weaken the grip of the myth of the given he presented an alternative myth in which our ancestors, initially limited to a purely behavioristic understanding of action, learned a new theory of action that posits inner episodes as the causes of overt behavior. At first our ancestors only applied the new theory to others, but then they learned to "read" their own mental states off their behavior. In the final stages of the myth they became adept at mental state self-attribution without theorizing from their behavior; nevertheless the self-attributed states remain the posits of an introduced theory of mind.

It need hardly be said that Sellars did not take himself to have accurately accounted for the historical origins of our capacity for mental state attribution. Rather, his aim was to open a new space in the debate about the status of mental state attributions by pointing out that mental states could be the posits of a theory of mind. As we shall see, subsequent generations took Sellars's suggestion entirely seriously, and were right to do so.

Another important historical source of the idea that our everyday understanding of mental states constitutes a folk theory of mind is the rise of cognitivism in the 1960s. Following the widespread perception that behaviorism had failed, cognitive scientists began to posit internal episodes as causes of overt behavior. These internal episodes were typically taken to be representations, and the term "theory" was applied to posited representational structures of sufficient complexity. For example, cognitive scientists seeking to explain our capacity to manipulate middle-sized physical objects posited an internally represented theory of dynamics, often referred to as "folk physics". (See for example McCloskey 1983.) It was only natural, therefore, that cognitive scientists adopted the explanatory strategy of positing internally represented theories when they attempted to explain our folk capacity to predict and explain behavior. The label "folk psychology" was widely adopted for that posit.

It is worth mentioning a third historical strand. Since at least the 1940s social psychologists have been interested in our capacity to attribute mental states to others. In an important early study, Heider and Simmel showed subjects a short movie which consisted of geometric shapes moving on a screen (Heider & Simmel 1944). When asked to report what they saw, almost every subject attributed propositional attitudes to the shapes, suggesting the existence of a universal and largely automatic capacity for propositional attitude attribution. In subsequent decades, social psychologists explored the accuracy and limitations of this capacity. For example, Nisbett and Wilson (1977) investigated a range of circumstances under which subjects mispredict their own behavior, and discovered that the circumstances under which such mispredictions occur are just those circumstances under which subjects offer contrived or confabulated explanations of their behavior.

2. Two Senses of "Folk Psychology"

I remarked above that many philosophers and cognitive scientists claim that our folk understanding of mental states constitutes a theory of mind. But we can unpack the idea of a folk understanding of mental states in two ways, yielding two different senses of "folk psychology": an externalist sense and an internalist sense (Stich & Ravenscroft 1994).

On the externalist account of folk psychology (hereafter "folk psychology (external)"), folk psychology is a theory of mind implicit in our everyday talk about mental states. In the everyday traffic of our lives we make remarks linking sensory experiences to mental states; mental states to other mental states; and mental states to behavior. Thus we remark that the smell of freshly baked bread made Sally feel hungry; that Sally wanted to go on a diet because she thought that she was overweight; and that Sally went to the fridge because she desired a piece of chocolate cake. According to some philosophers, remarks such as these (or suitable generalisations of remarks such as these) function as a term-introducing theory which implicitly defines terms such as "believe", "want" and "desire". (See for example Lewis 1972.)

On the internalist account of folk psychology (hereafter "folk psychology (internal)"), folk psychology is a theory of human psychology which is represented in the mind-brain and which underpins our everyday capacity to predict and explain the behavior of ourselves and others. On this view, folk psychology is a data structure or knowledge representation which mediates between our observations of behavior-in-circumstances and our predictions and explanations of that behavior.

The claim that our everyday understanding of mental states constitutes a folk theory of mind is often called the "theory theory". We have seen that two senses of "folk psychology" can be distinguished; similarly, two senses of "theory theory" can be distinguished. On the externalist reading of "theory theory", our everyday talk about mental states implicitly constitutes a theory of mind: folk psychology (external). I will call the externalist sense of the theory theory, "theory theory (external)". On the internalist reading of "theory theory", our everyday capacity to predict and explain behavior is underpinned by an internally represented theory of mind: folk psychology (internal). I will call the internalist sense of the theory theory "theory theory (internal)". Unfortunately, theory theorists are not always as clear as one might hope about which sense of "theory theory" they are endorsing.

It is important to stress any of the four theories just mentioned could turn out to be false. For example, it may turn out that our capacity to predict and explain behavior is not underpinned by an internally represented theory of the mind, in which case the theory theory (internal) is false. Or it could turn out that the theory theory (internal) is true, but the theory of mind it posits — folk psychology (internal) — is false. Again, it may turn out that our everyday talk about mental states does not constitute a term-introducing theory, in which case the theory theory (external) is false. Or it could turn out that the theory theory (external) is true, but the theory of mind implicit in our everyday talk about mental states — folk psychology (external) — is false. We will explore these issues in more detail in the next two sections.

3. The Nature and Status of Folk Psychology (External)

The principal architect of theory theory (external) is David Lewis (see especially Lewis 1972). Lewis instructs us to:

Collect all the platitudes … regarding the causal relations of mental states, sensory stimuli, and motor responses. … Add also all the platitudes to the effect that one mental state falls under another … Perhaps there are platitudes of other forms as well. Include only the platitudes which are common knowledge amongst us: everyone knows them, everyone knows that everyone else knows them, and so on. (Lewis 1972: 256.)

Having assembled the platitudes we can then form their conjunction. Let m1, … , mn be the mental state terms used in these platitudes. We can then express the conjunction of platitudes as:

S1(m1, … ,mn) & S2(m1, … ,mn) & … & Sj(m1, … ,mn)

where each Si(m1, … , mn) is a sentence in which some or all of the mental state terms mi occur. This conjunction will also contain a variety of terms which name non-mental states. For example, it will contain terms referring to types of sensory input (sharp blows; bright lights; gentle strokings) and to types of behavioral output (saying "ouch"; shielding the eyes; smiling). Following Lewis we can call these terms the O-terms (O1, … , On). In the interests of clarity, these terms have been suppressed.

We can now replace (each occurrence of) mental state term mi by a corresponding free variable xi:

S1(x1, … , xn) & S2(x1, … , xn) & … & Sj(x1, … ,xn)

Prefixing an existential quantifier we obtain the Ramsey sentence for folk psychology:

∃x1 … xn[S1(x1, … , xn) & S2(x1, … , xn) & … & Sj(x1, … ,xn)]

The Ramsey sentence for folk psychology says that there exists a set of entities x1, … , xn which exhibit just those relations which the states named by the term m1, … , mn exhibit. It is possible to obtain from the Ramsey sentence an explicit definition of any mental state term mi. (See Lewis 1972 for the formal details.) Lewis has thus shown how to obtain an explicit definition of any mental state term mi from the collected platitudes; in other words, he has shown how we can treat our everyday talk about mental states as a term-introducing theory of mind.

To clarify Lewis's Ramsey sentence approach, assume that our everyday talk about mental states consists of just three platitudes:

These platitudes express the causal relationships between bodily damage and pain; between pain and states of acute distress; and between pain and a certain sort of behavior (nursing the afflicted body part).

Using "m1" for "pain" and "m2" for "acute distress", we can write the conjunction of P1 to P3 as:

S1(m1) & S2(m1, m2) & S3(m1)

Once again the O-terms have been suppressed in the interests of clarity, but it is worth bearing in mind that the O-terms include a name referring to bodily damage and a name referring to a certain sort of behavior, viz, nursing the afflicted body part.

Replacing m1 and m2 with free variables x1 and x2, respectively, we obtain:

S1(x1) & S2(x1, x2) & S3(x1).

Prefixing an existential quantifier we obtain the Ramsey sentence for our toy theory:

∃x1, x2[S1(x1) & S2(x1, x2) & S3(x1)].

The Ramsey sentence says that there exists states x1 and x2 that (respectively) play the roles accorded to pain and acute distress by the platitudes P1 to P3.

From the Ramsey sentence we can obtain an explicit definition of, say, m1. (Again readers are encouraged to consult Lewis 1972 for the formal details.)

m1 (i.e., pain) = the unique x1 such that x1 is caused by bodily damage, causes acute distress, and causes the nursing of the afflicted body part.

Notice that the definition of m1 was obtained from the platitudes: nothing was added during the process of defining m1. It is clear, therefore, that the definition was implicit in the platitudes all along.

This example makes it clear that Lewis is primarily concerned with those platitudes which detail "the causal relations of mental states, sensory stimuli, and motor responses" (Lewis 1972: 256). Lewis is therefore interpreting folk psychology as a functionalist theory; that is, as a theory which identifies mental states in terms of their causal-functional relations. Indeed, some authors use the terms "theory theory" and "functionalism" interchangeably. Attractive though Lewis's position is, it is at least partly hostage to fortune. For it is an open question whether the theory implicit in our everyday platitudes about mental states really is a strictly functionalist one. Many authors have doubted that, for example, our talk about qualia can be adequately cashed out in functionalist terms. (See for example Chalmers 1996.) Indeed, it is an open question whether our everyday talk about mental states is sufficiently systematic to support Lewis's Ramsey sentence approach.

There is, moreover, a largely empirical question to be raised about folk psychology (external). For even if we accept that our everyday talk about mental states implicitly constitutes a theory of mind, it remains to be determined if that theory is true. Maybe future research in psychology or neuroscience will establish that folk psychology (external) is false. And if folk psychology (external) is false, it would seem to follow that there are no such thing as beliefs and desires, pains, hungers and tickles. This surprising doctrine is called eliminativism, and has been a major focus of discussion amongst philosophers of mind over the last 20 years. (See materialism: eliminative; Churchland 1981; Horgan & Woodward 1985.)

4. The Nature and Status of Folk Psychology (Internal)

In our everyday social interactions we both predict and explain behavior, and our explanations are couched in a mentalistic vocabulary which includes terms like "belief" and "desire". For brevity's sake we can refer to such activities as mentalizing, and we can ask about the cognitive mechanisms which underpin our capacity to mentalize. According to the theory theory (internal), our capacity for mentalization crucially involves an internally represented theory of mind: folk psychology (internal). On this view, predicting and explaining human behavior is akin to predicting and explaining the movements of the heavenly bodies using Newton's mechanics. As we shall see, this analogy is very rough, but it emphasizes the central place given to theorizing on the theory theory model.

Four important issues need to be stressed.

  1. It is important to note that internal theory theorists need not be committed to any particular theory of mental representation. In particular, they need not be committed to the language of thought hypothesis. Folk psychology (internal) may be represented in the language of thought, or by a distributed connectionist network, or by some other means (Stich & Nichols 1992). This raises the important question of the sufficient conditions for possession of an internally represented theory. To take a simple example, consider a cognitive system S which outputs "x" whenever it is given as input "x & y". Under what circumstances are we entitled to say that S possesses a representation of the rule of &-elimination (from "A & B" conclude "A")? Gareth Evans has suggested that S possesses a representation of the &-elimination rule only if all its transitions from "A & B" to "A" are mediated by the same mechanism. (See Evans 1981; Davies 1989). But, as we shall see shortly, this approach creates difficulties when applied to the mentalizing case.

  2. It is also important to note that internal theory theorists need not be committed to the claim that folk psychology (internal) is learned the way that we learn, say, physics or chemistry. (It is here that the analogy with Newtonian mechanics breaks down.) Some internalist theory theorists have argued that folk psychology (internal) is largely learned (see especially Gopnik & Wellman 1992; Gopnik & Melzoff 1997). According to Alison Gopnik and Andrew Meltzoff, the young child develops a theory of human behavior in much the same way that a scientist develops a scientific theory. This hypothesis has been called the "child as little scientist" position, although Gopnik and Meltzoff prefer the label "scientist as big child".

    Other internalist theory theorists argue that folk psychology (internal) is largely innate, or at least that we are born with a mechanism dedicated to its acquisition. (See for example Fodor 1992; Carruthers 1996: especially Section 1.7). There are strong parallels here with debates about nativism in psycholinguistics. Some linguists argue that our capacity to use language is a product of natural selection. (See for example Pinker 1994; for a fairly critical discussion of issues in the evolution of language see Ravenscroft in press). In a similar way, some internalist theory theorists argue that our capacity to mentalize is a product of natural selection. (See for example Baron-Cohen 1992.) Poverty of stimulus arguments have played an important role in the debate about linguistic nativism. Linguistic nativists have argued that the child's linguistic environment is too informationally impoverished to account for the acquisition of language and so genetic inheritance must play a role. (See for example Pinker 1994; Cowie 1999). Similarly, a poverty of stimulus argument can be advanced in the case of folk psychology (internal): Is it really plausible that the four-year-old has been exposed to enough examples of behavior-in-circumstances to construct, via induction, a full blown theory of human behavior?

    Internalist theory theorists of both the learned and nativist varieties must account for the observed pattern of acquisition of the capacity to mentalize (Wellman 1990 is an outstanding introduction to this area). For example, it is not until children are about four years old that they can predict the behavior of agents with (relevant) false beliefs. Alison Gopnik and her colleagues (Gopnik & Wellman 1992; Gopnik & Melzoff 1997) have attempted to explain the pattern of acquisition in terms of theory development; Fodor (1992) has argued that it reflects more general features of cognitive development.

  3. The internalist version of the theory theory raises an important issue in psychopathology. Developmental psychologists have developed tests for young children's capacity to mentalize. Intriguingly, people with autism perform badly on these tests, even when the studies take into account IQ and mental age. This has lead to the suggestion that people with autism either lack folk psychology (internal), or lack the ability to make full use of folk psychology (internal). (See Baron-Cohen, Leslie & Frith 1985. See also Part III of Carruthers & Smith 1996 and Currie & Ravenscroft 2002.)

  4. The empirical investigation of folk psychology (internal) has largely been conducted within the field of social psychology. Whereas philosophers tend to assume that the attribution of propositional attitudes such as beliefs and desires plays a central role in folk psychology (internal), social psychologists have emphasized the role played by the attribution of character traits and behavioral dispositions, and the impact of appearance on such attributions (Von Eckardt 1997). Amongst many other examples, Barbara Von Eckardt gives the case of judging others to be "baby-faced". Individuals who are judged to be baby-faced are typically assumed to lack physical strength, social status and intellectual astuteness. Von Eckardt also considers what recent research in social psychology might tell us about the truth (or otherwise) of folk psychology (internal). In her view the social psychological literature supports some aspects of folk psychology (internal) but not others. The example just given about people who are judged to be baby-faced is a clear case where folk psychology (internal) has gone amiss: there is no reason to think that those judged to be baby-faced lack, say, intellectual astuteness. In other cases folk psychology (internal) seems less wide of the mark. For example, it seems to have correctly identified some (but not all) of the correlations between behavior and personality traits. (See von Eckardt 1997 for details.)

It should be clear that the internal theory theory is a very attractive position; nevertheless, it has not remained unchallenged. Simulation theorists have argued that our mentalizing capacity is not primarily a capacity to theorize about the mental states of others, but is rather a capacity to simulate the mental processes of others. (See folk psychology: as mental simulation. The debate between simulation theorists and internal theory theorists has both conceptual and empirical dimensions. An important empirical issue concerns the kinds of errors to which mentalizing is prone. (See Stich & Nichols 1992; Ravenscroft 1999). An important conceptual issue concerns the potential "collapse" of simulation theory into internal theory theory. This debate is driven by the issue of the sufficient conditions for possession of an internally represented theory (see above). On some accounts of theory representation, simulation theory turns out to involve possession of an internally represented theory of human behavior, thus threatening to collapse simulation theory into the theory theory (internal). (See Davies 1994; Heal 1994; Ravenscroft 2003.)

5. Concluding Remarks

I have identified two distinct senses of "folk psychology". What is the relationship between the theories to which those terms refer? It is implausible that the theory of mind implicit in our everyday talk about mental states is simply identical to the internally represented theory of mind which underpins our capacity to mentalize. Rather, it is likely that folk psychology (internal) is partly inaccessible to consciousness, and that folk psychology (external) is an articulation of that fragment of folk psychology (internal) which is available to conscious reflection. It follows that our everyday talk about the mind is only a rough guide to folk psychology (internal).

The previous paragraph assumed that the theory theory is true on both its internalist and its externalist readings. But if simulation theory is true, our capacity to mentalize is not underpinned by folk psychology (internal) and so the theory theory (internal) is false. Note, though, that the theory theory (external) could remain true even if the internalist version were false: simulation theory is compatible with the idea that our everyday talk about mental states implicitly constitutes a theory of mind. These options, and the consequences for eliminativism, are considered in more detail in Stich & Ravenscroft 1994.

Bibliography

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Related Entries

folk psychology: as mental simulation | functionalism | materialism: eliminative | Sellars, Wilfrid

Acknowledgments

The author would like to thank Barbara Von Eckardt for helpful comments on an earlier version.