Projectivism and quasi-realism

Simon Blackburn has been one of moral noncognitivism's staunchest defenders in recent years (1984, 1993a, 1998). Blackburn is not only a noncognitivist but a moral projectivist. Since the two are often conflated, it is necessary to tease them apart.

Projectivism is best thought of as a causal account of moral experience. Consider a straightforward, observation-based moral judgment: Jane sees two youths hurting a cat and thinks “That is impermissible.” The causal story begins with a real event in the world: two youth performing actions, a suffering cat, etc. Then there is Jane's sensory perception of this event (she sees the youths, hears the cat's howls, etc.). Jane may form certain inferential beliefs concerning, say, the youths' intentions, the cats' pain, etc. All this prompts in Jane an emotion: She disapproves (say). She then “projects” this emotion onto her experience of the world, which results in her judging the action to be impermissible. In David Hume's words: “taste [as opposed to reason] has a productive faculty, and gilding and staining all natural objects with the colours, borrowed from internal sentiment, raises in a manner a new creation” (Hume [1751] 1983: 88). Here, impermissibility is the “new creation.” This is not to say that Jane “sees” the action to instantiate impermissibility in the same way as she sees the cat to instantiate brownness; but she judges the world to contain a certain quality, and her doing so is not the product of her tracking a real feature of the world, but is, rather, prompted by an emotional experience.

Putting aside any doubts about the plausibility or even coherence of projectivism, what relation does it bear to noncognitivism? Even if we construe noncognitivism in a mentalistic manner—as a thesis concerning what kind of mental states moral judgments are—there is no obvious implication relation. Although an emotional episode is a central component of the whole projectivist chain of events, it doesn't follow that the moral judgment must (or should) be identified with that component. Projectivism, after all, implies an account of moral phenomenology: It implies that moral properties appear as if they are in the world. Perhaps sometimes we know better; perhaps sometimes although we cannot help but experience the world as containing some quality, we don't believe that it really does (just as we know that the stick in the water is straight although we cannot help but see it as bent). But it is widely accepted by projectivists that often we don't know better—that we are taken in by our own projectivist tendencies. And if this is so, then it is natural to assume that Jane ultimately believes that the action is impermissible: Her emotional projection results in a belief. And since this belief is at least as good a candidate as the emotion for being identified as the moral judgment, projectivism is perfectly compatible with mentalistic cognitivism.

The same argument holds, mutatis mutandis, if we choose to characterize noncognitivism as a thesis concerning sentences or speech acts. Since we can assume that the language with which people discuss moral matters will reflect their experience, then when they say things like “Hurting that cat is impermissible” we can assume that they are asserting that the situation instantiates this property (the property that they have in fact projected onto their experience). But if they are asserting such things—that is, expressing their beliefs on the matter—then they cannot simply be expressing their emotions.

It is also possible to accept the projectivist account of moral experience while identifying impermissibility (say) with some feature of the world: say, the “power” (to use an old-fashioned Lockean term) to prompt a certain response in the viewer. According to such a view, when Jane utters the sentence “Hurting that cat is impermissible” what she is doing is best interpreted as asserting that the act of hurting the cat has the power to prompt a certain kind of emotional response in her (or in some person in specifiable ideal circumstances). One might even hold that she should be interpreted as asserting that the act of hurting the cat has the power to prompt a certain act of emotional projection. And since the act may indeed have this property, her assertion may be true. Whether this will count as a form of moral realism depends on how we choose to specify the relevant (in)dependency relation between moral facts and our mental activity (to be discussed in section 5 of main entry). But certainly on some such specifications this will count as a form of moral realism. Thus not only is it a mistake to think that projectivism is the province solely of the noncognitivist; it would be equally mistaken to assume that it is the province solely of the moral anti-realist. (See Craig 2000 for an argument for the compatibility of projectivism and realism in Hume's views on causality.)

Blackburn is not only a noncognitivist and a moral projectivist, but a quasi-realist. Quasi-realism is best thought of not as a philosophical position but as a philosophical program. The quasi-realist is someone who endorses an anti-realist metaphysical stance (perhaps a particular kind of anti-realist metaphysical stance—see final paragraph of this supplement) but who seeks, through philosophical maneuvering, to earn the right for moral discourse to enjoy all the trappings of realist talk. Such a view may hold that although the underlying logical structure of the sentence “Stealing is wrong” is nothing more than “Stealing: Boo!”, it is still legitimate for ordinary speakers to use such language as “Fred believes that stealing is wrong,” “If stealing is wrong, then so is borrowing without permission,” “Stealing would remain wrong regardless of what anyone thought of it,” “The sentence ‘Stealing is wrong’ is true,” and even, perhaps, “The property of wrongness is instantiated by stealing.” Blackburn (1993a: 184-6) identifies two types of quasi-realism: the fast track and the slow track.

Fast track quasi-realism begins by earning the right for the truth predicate to be applied to moral sentences, and then observes that once the legitimacy of the truth predicate is established much (all?) other realist talk comes along for free. Thus, for example, once it is allowed that “Stealing is wrong” may be considered true or false—in virtue of nothing more than its surface propositional grammar (even though it really means nothing more than “Stealing: Boo!”), then there is no special problem associated with this sentence appearing as the antecedent of a conditional.

Slow track quasi-realism, by contrast, doesn't attempt to earn the right to realist talk all in one fell swoop (via establishing the legitimacy of the truth predicate), but rather seeks to demonstrate the acceptability of different types of apparently realist talk in a more piecemeal fashion. Thus the slow track quasi-realist will devote energy to showing how sentences taking the form of interjections (e.g., “Stealing: Boo!”) may still function very much like antecedents of conditionals (and thus as premises of valid arguments). This project has seen Blackburn undertake the convoluted task of establishing a special logic of interjections—one which mirrors the regular logic of proposition-stating sentences.

One may wonder why, if fast track quasi-realism promises to succeed, the piecemeal approach of the slow track is also necessary—especially given that the latter is (it is agreed by all hands) the more intimidating project. Blackburn's answer is that the two approaches can play off each other in a mutually beneficial way. Results from the slow lane contribute to establishing the principal objective of the fast track: to earn the right to the use of the truth predicate in reference to moral sentences. “Fast-track quasi-realism can benefit from the security provided by slow-track” (1993a: 197).

One of the main challenges for the quasi-realist is to maintain a theoretic distance from the moral realist. If the quasi-realist program succeeds in vindicating the use of the truth predicate for moral sentences, if it in addition makes it permissible to say “It is a fact that stealing is wrong,” “It is a mind-independent fact that stealing is wrong,” “Stealing would be wrong even if our attitude towards it were different,” and so on—mimicking all and any of the moral realist's assertions—then in what sense is quasi-realism quasi-realism?—Why has it not simply collapsed into the robust moral realism that it set out to oppose? (See Dreier 2004; Lewis 2005.)

Because Blackburn is all three—a moral noncognitivist, a moral projectivist, and a moral quasi-realist—and because he has had such an influence on recent metaethics, these terms have become somewhat confused in certain quarters. It is important to recognize the significant independence of all of them. One can be a noncognitivist without being either a projectivist or a quasi-realist; one can be a projectivist without being either a noncognitivist or a quasi-realist; and one can be a quasi-realist without being either a noncognitivist or a projectivist. Only the last might raise an eyebrow, given Blackburn's characterization of quasi-realism as “the enterprise of explaining why our discourse has the shape it does … if projectivism is true” (1984: 180). This appears to make it true by definition that all quasi-realists are projectivists. This may well be so, but there are a couple of reasons for hesitating. First, Blackburn has a distinctive and somewhat idiosyncratic understanding of projectivism, so there are certain philosophical paradigms of projectivism that his claim is not intended to cover (see Joyce forthcoming). Second, there would be nothing obviously objectionable (perhaps not even anything that Blackburn would object to) in broadening quasi-realism into the project of earning the right to realist talk from any anti-realist starting point—in which case quasi-realism could be a program undertaken by, say, an error theorist.