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Wilfrid Sellars
Wilfrid Stalker Sellars (b. 1912, d. 1989) was a profoundly creative
and synthetic thinker whose work both as a systematic philosopher
and as an influential editor helped set and shape the Anglo-American
philosophical agenda for over four decades. Sellars is perhaps
best known for his classic 1956 essay "Empiricism and the
Philosophy of Mind", a comprehensive and sophisticated critique
of "the myth of the given" which played a major role
in the postwar deconstruction of Cartesianism, but his published
corpus of three books and more than one hundred essays includes
numerous original contributions to ontology, epistemology, and
the philosophies of science, language, and mind, as well as sensitive
historical and exegetical studies.
- 1912 born May 20 in Ann Arbor, MI
- 1933 receives AB at the University of Michigan
- 1934 receives AM at the University of Buffalo, NY, enters
Oriel College, Oxford, as a Rhodes Scholar
- 1936 receives BA with First Class Honours in Philosophy, Politics,
and Economics (MA 1940)
- 1938 becomes Assistant Professor of Philosophy, University
of Iowa
- 1943 enters U.S. Naval Reserve, assigned to Air Combat Intelligence
- 1946 becomes Assistant Professor of Philosophy, University
of Minnesota
- 1950 founds Philosophical Studies with Herbert Feigl,
the first scholarly forum explicitly created for the new hybrid
"analytic philosophy"
- 1951 becomes Professor of Philosophy, University of Minnesota
- 1956 serves as Special Lecturer in Philosophy at the University
of London, published as "Empiricism and the Philosophy of
Mind"
- 1958 moves to Yale University, CN, first as a visitor, subsequently
as Professor of Philosophy
- 1963 assumes the position of University Professor of Philosophy
and Research Professor of Philosophy at the University of Pittsburgh,
PA, publishes Science, Perception and Reality
- 1965 delivers John Locke Lectures for 1965-66 at Oxford University,
subsequently published as Science and Metaphysics
- 1970 serves as president of the Eastern Division of the American
Philosophical Association
- 1971 delivers Matchette Foundation Lectures, University of
Texas, subsequently published as "The Structure of Knowledge"
- 1973 delivers John Dewey Lectures for 1973-74, University
of Chicago, IL, subsequently published as Naturalism and Ontology
- 1977 delivers Paul Carus Lectures for 1977-78 at the Eastern
Division meetings of the American Philosophical Association, later
published as "Foundations for a Metaphysics of Pure Process"
- 1987 Colloquium in Sellarsian Philosophy held at University
of Pittsburgh in honor of Sellars’s 75th birthday
- 1989 dies at home in Pittsburgh, PA, on July 2
Sellars was a systematic philosopher par excellence. "The
aim of philosophy," he wrote, "is to understand how
things in the broadest possible sense of the term hang together
in the broadest possible sense of the term." [PSIM, 37] This
image of the philosopher as a reflective generalist recurs
frequently in Sellars’s metaphilosophical reflections. His most
explicit account of the central task confronting contemporary
philosophy aligns it firmly with the modernist project of achieving
a rapprochement between our humanistic understanding of
ourselves as free and rational agents, at home among meanings
and values, and the thoroughly "disenchanted" picture
of the world being painted by an increasingly comprehensive natural
science. Sellars thematized this contrast as a confrontation of
two "images": the "manifest image"
whose primary objects are persons, beings who can and do
conceive of themselves as sentient perceivers, cognitive knowers,
and deliberative agents, and the "scientific image",
whose primary entities are some sophisticated version of "atoms
in the void". "The scientific image," Sellars wrote,
"presents itself as a rival image. From its point
of view the manifest image on which it [methodologically] rests
is an ‘inadequate’ but pragmatically useful likeness of a reality
which first finds its adequate (in principle) likeness in the
scientific image." [PSIM, 57] As Sellars saw it, the goal
of philosophy was to transform this tension between our lived
self-conception and our hard won explanatory understanding of
the world into a single "stereoscopic" image, a synoptic
vision of persons-in-the-world. Much of his philosophical work
is addressed to three central moments of this complex undertaking:
accommodating the intentional contents of thought and language,
the sensuous contents of perception and imagination, and
the normative dimensions of knowledge and conduct within
such a stereoscopic image - all the while resolutely maintaining
a robust scientific realism, for "in the dimension of describing
and explaining the world, science is the measure of all things,
of what is that it is, and of what is not that it is not."
[EPM, 173]
Sellars’s interpretation of the epistemology of natural science
departed decisively from the received view according to which
explanation was identified with derivation - singular matters
of empirical fact being explained by deriving descriptions of
them from ("inductively" established) empirical generalizations
(along with appropriate statements of initial conditions), and
these "empirical laws" in turn being explained by deriving
them from theoretical postulates and correspondence rules. On
this received Positivist view, in consequence, theories (e.g.,
microtheories) explain observational matters of fact only indirectly,
by implying generalizations framed in the observation-language
that explain them directly.
Sellars regarded this "levels picture" of theories as
fundamentally misleading. Theories do not explain laws by entailing
them. Rather, "theories explain laws by explaining why the
objects of the domain in question obey the laws that they do to
the extent that they do." (LT,123)
[That is,] they explain why individual objects of various kinds
and in various circumstances in the observation framework behave
in those ways in which it has been inductively established that
they do behave. Roughly, it is because a gas is ... a cloud of
molecules which are behaving in certain theoretically defined
ways, that it obeys the empirical Boyle-Charles Law. (LT,121)
On Sellars’s view stories that postulate "theoretical
entities" are not merely manageable second-class surrogates for
more complicated and unwieldy stories about entities that we have
good, i.e., observational, reasons to believe actually
exist. Theoretical entities, rather, are those entities we warrantedly
believe to exist for good and sufficient theoretical
reasons. On this understanding, scientific theories explanatorily
"save the appearances" precisely by characterizing the
reality of which the appearances are appearances.
Like Quine, Sellars was deeply influenced by the work of Rudolf
Carnap. Sellars’s sophisticated account of the nature and import
of theoretical reasoning in natural science, however, enabled
him to develop a systematic naturalistic alternative to
Quine’s influential critique of Carnapian logical empiricism.
In particular, the epistemological contrast between two sorts
of empirical generalizations - those adopted on narrowly inductive
grounds and those expressing constitutive principles of postulational
theories adopted on broadly empirical, i.e., explanatory grounds
- enabled Sellars to distinguish among three different grades
of "observational involvement": observations and general
claims individually validated "inductively" by way of
direct appeals to observational backing, the constitutive
posits of postulational theories holistically validated by way
of indirect, explanatory appeals to observational backing,
and purely formal claims expressing necessary conditions for the
formulation of scientific hypotheses in general. Consequently,
where Quine rejected the classical Kantian analytic-synthetic
dichotomy out of hand, Sellars argued that there were two quite
different distinctions tangled up in the single dichotomy that
Carnap had inherited from the Kantian tradition: the distinction
between logical and empirical (matter-of-factual) claims
(analytic2-synthetic2),
and the distinction between claims whose revision requires abandonment
or modification of the system of (theoretical) concepts in terms
of which they are framed and claims revisable on the basis of
observations formulated in terms of a system of (theoretical)
concepts which remained fixed throughout
(analytic1-synthetic1).
Like Quine, then, Sellars moved decisively away from classical
Kantian rationalism, but in the direction of a Kantian empiricism
which preserved logical space for a theory of semantic meaning
and the correlative distinctions between individual matter-of-factual
truths and truths which, although belonging to theoretical systems
themselves adopted on broadly empirical (synthetic2)
grounds, were, relative to such a system, true ex vi terminorum
(analytic1):
Kant’s Rationalism
Grounded in experience
("a posteriori", simple induction)
| Not so grounded
("a priori")
|
| Synthetic
| Analytic |
Empirical Laws
(regularities)
| Arithmetic, Geometry, Mechanics
("synthetic a priori")
| Logic |
| "Our conceptual framework" (innate principles)
|
Kantian Empiricism
| Grounded in experience (Empirical)
| Not so grounded |
| Synthetic2
| Analytic2 (L-true)
|
| Synthetic1
| Analytic1
|
Observation, Simple Induction
(Operational geometry, mechanics)
| Postulation
(Physical geometry, idealizing scientific theories, mechanics, micro-physics)
| Logic, arithmetic, mathematical analysis
(Pure geometry qua calculus)
|
| "Our conceptual framework":
|
| Material (empirical) categories
| Formal (ontological) categories
|
Essential to Sellars’s thoroughgoing naturalism is an account
of semantic meaning that requires no recourse to irreducibly platonistic
or mentalistic idioms. Sellars consequently resolutely locates
the normative conceptual order within the causal order and advances
a naturalistic interpretation of the modes of causality exercised
by linguistic rules centered on the notion of pattern-governed
behavior, i.e.:
behavior which exhibits a pattern, not because it is brought about
by the intention that it exhibit this pattern, but because the
propensity to emit behavior of the pattern has been selectively
reinforced, and the propensity to emit behavior which does not
conform to this pattern selectively extinguished. (MFC,423)
Pattern-governed behavior characteristic of a species - e.g.,
the dance of the bees - can arise from processes of natural selection
on an evolutionary time scale, but, crucially, pattern-governed
behavior can also be developed in individual "trainees"
by deliberate selective reinforcement on the part of other individuals,
the trainers, acting under the guidance of linguistic rules
of criticism. In contrast to linguistic rules of action,
e.g., "Ceteris paribus, one ought to (or: may) say such and
such if in circumstances C", which can be efficacious in
guiding linguistic activity only to the extent that their subjects
already possess the concepts of "saying such-and-such",
"being in circumstances C", and, indeed, obeying a rule
(i.e., doing something because it is enjoined or permitted by
a rule), rules of criticism are ought-to-be’s - e.g., "Westminster
clock chimes ought to strike on the quarter hour" (LTC,95)
- whose subjects, although their performances may be assessed
according to such rules, need not themselves have the concept
of a rule nor, indeed, any concepts at all. Thus a trainer can
be construed as reasoning
Patterned-behavior of such and such a kind ought to be exhibited
by trainees, hence we, the trainers, ought to do this and that,
as likely to bring it about that it is exhibited. (MFC,423)
And, in consequence of the conducts of trainers under the guidance of
such rules of action, the behavior of a language-learner can come to
conform to the relevant rules of criticism without his
"grasping" them himself in any other sense. "Trainees
conform to ought-to-be’s because trainers obey corresponding
ought-to-do’s." (MFC,423)
Against this background, then, Sellars advanced an account of meaning
as functional classification according to which semantic idioms
in the first instance mark contexts within which structurally distinct
"natural-linguistic objects" (e.g., utterings or
inscribings) are classified in terms of their roles or functions in
language entry transitions (linguistic responses to perceptual
stimuli), language exit transitions (causal-linguistic
antecedents of non-linguistic conduct), and intra-linguistic
moves (inferential transitions from one linguistic representing to
another). In particular, ‘means’ is interpreted as a specialized form
of the copula, tailored to metalinguistic contexts, according to which
the right side of the superficially relational form "___ means
. . . ." is properly understood as mentioning or exhibiting a
linguistic item.
On Sellars’s view, such special copulae and metalinguistic indicators
initially arise in response to the need to abstract from our domestic
sign designs in order to classify items of different languages
on the basis of such functional criteria. In this project, ordinary
quotation suffers from a systematic ambiguity regarding the criteria
- structural (e.g., geometric, acoustic) or functional - according
to which linguistic tokens are classifiable as belonging to this
or that linguistic type. Accordingly, Sellars introduced a more
straightforward device of two separate styles of quotation marks,
star-quotes and dot-quotes, tied respectively to the structural
and functional modes of sorting and individuating lexical items.
Both star- and dot-quotes are illustrating, and thus indexical,
devices, but dot-quotes are, in a sense, doubly so. For, whereas
star-quotes form a common noun that is true of inscriptions (empirical
structures) appropriately design-isomorphic to the token exhibited
between them, dot-quotes form a common noun true of items in any
language that play the role or do the job performed in our language
by the tokens exhibited between them. In terms of this notational
apparatus, then, such semantic claims as, for example,
- (1s) (In German) ‘rot’ means red.
- (2s) (In German) ‘Schnee ist weiss’ means snow is white.
can be more perspicuously expressed by
- (1*) (In the German linguistic community) *rot*s are .red.s.
- (2*) (In the German linguistic community) *Schnee ist weiss*s
are .snow is white.s.
-
Once such a distinction between functional and structural
classification of linguistic representing items is in hand, it is a
straightforward matter to extend it to an account of mental
representations, i.e., thoughts, as well. Unlike Quine, Sellars
never abandoned the classical notion of thoughts as intentional
inner episodes that play a causal-explanatory role
vis-à-vis overt, paradigmatically linguistic,
behavior. Consistent with his thoroughgoing naturalism, however,
correlative to his ontological "linguistic nominalism",
Sellars embraced a form of "psychological nominalism", whose
leitmotif was
. . . the denial of the claim, characteristic of the realist tradition,
that a "perception" or "awareness" of abstract
entities is the root mental ingredient of mental acts and dispositions.
(EAE,445)
Instead, Sellars argued, the proper account of the distinctive
intentionality of thought is also to be drawn in terms of the
forms and functions of natural linguistic items. The positive
thesis correlative to psychological nominalism, consequently,
is modeled by what Sellars came to call "verbal behaviorism".
According to VB [verbal behaviorism], thinking ‘that-p,’ where
this means ‘having the thought occur to one that-p,’ has as its
primary sense [an event of] saying ‘p’; and a secondary sense
in which it stands for a short term proximate propensity [dispositional]
to say ‘p’. (MFC,419)
The origins of Sellars’s mature forms of verbal behaviorism lie
in the revolutionary theses of his classic essay "Empiricism
and the Philosophy of Mind", and, in particular, in his mythical
story of our Rylean ancestors and the genius Jones. The story
begins in medias res with people who have mastered
a "Rylean language", a sophisticated expressive system,
including logical operators and subjunctive conditionals, whose
fundamental descriptive vocabulary pertains to public spatio-temporal
objects. Consonant with the Sellarsian account of linguistic meaning
as functional classification, this hypothetical Rylean language,
although lacking any resources for speaking of inner episodes,
thoughts or experiences has been enriched by the fundamental resources
of semantical discourse - enabling our ancestors to say of the
their peers’ utterances that they mean this or that, that they
stand in various logical relations to one another, that they are
true or false, and so on. In this milieu now appears the genius
Jones.
[In] the attempt to account for the fact that his fellow men behave
intelligently not only when their conduct is threaded on a string
of overt verbal episodes . . . but also when no detectable verbal
output is present, Jones develops a theory according to which
overt utterances are but the culmination of a process which begins
with certain inner episodes. . . . [His] model for these episodes
which initiate the events which culminate in overt verbal behavior
is that of overt verbal behavior itself. (EPM,186)
Although the primary use of semantical terms remains the semantical
characterization of overt verbal episodes, this Jonesean theory thus
carries over the applicability of those semantical categories to its
postulated inner episodes. i.e., to (occurrent) thoughts. The point
of the Jonesean myth is to suggest that the epistemological
status of thoughts (qua inner episodes) vis-à-vis candid public
verbal performances is most usefully understood as analogous to
the epistemological status of, e.g., molecules vis-à-vis the
public observable behavior of gases.
[Thought] episodes are ‘in’ language-using animals as molecular
impacts are ‘in’ gases, not as ‘ghosts’ are in ‘machines’. (EPM,187)
Unlike molecules, however, which are introduced into kinetic gas
theory as having a specific empirical character (represented by the
posited essentially Newtonian lawfulness of their dynamic
interactions), the thought episodes postulated by that theory as
covert states of persons are introduced by a purely functional
analogy. The concept of an occurrent thought is that of a
causally-mediating logico-semantic role player, whose determinate
empirical/ontological character, and thereby logical space for some
form of "identity theory" is so far left open.
[The] fact that [thoughts] are not introduced as physiological
entities does not preclude the possibility that at a later methodological
stage they may, so to speak, ‘turn out’ to be such. Thus, there
are many who would say that it is already reasonable to suppose
that these thoughts are to be ‘identified’ with complex events
in the cerebral cortex . . . (EPM,187-8)
Since, on Sellars’s account, the concept of a thought is fundamentally
the concept of a functional kind, no ontological tensions would
be generated by the identification within the scientific image
of items belonging to that functional kind with, for instance,
states and episodes of an organism’s central nervous system. The
manifest image’s conception of person as thinkers, Sellars concludes,
can fuse smoothly with the scientific image’s conception of persons
as complex material organisms having a determinate physiological
and neurological structure.
The idea that the intentionality of the mental is to be understood
in terms of epistemologically theoretical transpositions of the
semantic categories of public language, themselves interpreted
as modes of functional classification earn Sellars a definitive
place in contemporary analytic philosophy of mind. As Dennett
puts it,
Thus was contemporary functionalism in the philosophy of mind
born, and the varieties of functionalism we have subsequently
seen are in one way or another enabled, and directly or indirectly
inspired, by what was left open in Sellars’ initial proposal ...
(MTE,341)
Sellars’s proposal that we can illuminate the epistemic status
of mental concepts by an appeal to the contrast between theoretical
and non-theoretical discourse makes sense only against the background
of another central element of his philosophical thought, his comprehensive
critique of "myth of the given". The philosophical framework
of givenness historically takes on many guises, including not
only the idea that empirical knowledge rests on a foundation,
but also, crucially, the assumption that the "privacy"
of the mental and one’s "privileged access" to one’s
own mental states are fundamental features of experience, both
logically and epistemologically prior to all intersubjective concepts
pertaining to inner episodes.
Sellars argues, on the contrary, that what begins in the case
of inner episodes as a language with a purely theoretical use
can acquire a first-person reporting role. It can turn out to
be possible to train people, in essence by a process of operant
conditioning, to have "privileged access" to some of
their inner episodes, that is, to respond directly and non-inferentially
to the occurrence of one thought with another (meta-) thought
to the effect that one is thinking it. It is a special virtue
of this aspect of Sellars’s Jonesean story that it shows how the
essential intersubjectivity of language can be reconciled with
the "privacy" of inner episodes, i.e.,
. . . that it helps us understand that concepts pertaining to
such inner episodes as thoughts are primarily and essentially
inter-subjective, as inter-subjective as the concept of a positron,
and that the [first-person] reporting role of these concepts .
. . constitutes a dimension of [their] use . . . which is built
on and presupposes this inter-subjective status. (EPM,189)
At the heart of Sellars’s general case against the Myth of the
Given is his articulate recognition of the irreducibly normative
character of epistemic discourse.
The essential point is that in characterizing an episode or a
state as that of knowing, we are not giving an empirical description
of that episode or state, we are placing it in the logical space
of reasons, of justifying and being able to justify what one says.
(EPM,169)
Once it is acknowledged that the senses per se grasp no facts,
that all knowledge that something is such-and-so (all "subsumption
of particulars under universals") presupposes learning, concept
formation, and even symbolic representation, it follows that ".
. . instead of coming to have a concept of something because we
have noticed that sort of thing, to have the ability to notice
a sort of thing is already to have the concept of that sort of
thing, and cannot account for it." (EPM,176)
Sellars follows Kant in rejecting the Cartesian picture of a
sensory-cognitive continuum. The "of-ness" of sensations
- e.g., a sensation’s being of a red triangle or of a sharp
shooting pain - he insists, is not the intentional "of-ness"
("aboutness") of thoughts. The "rawness" of
"raw feels" is rather their non-conceptual
character. (cf. IAMBP,376) Consequently, while his
epistemological views regarding sensory episodes parallel his
treatment of the epistemology of occurrent thoughts, Sellars’s account
of the ontology of sensations diverges dramatically from his
functionalist account of thoughts.
In a final episode of the Jonesean myth, sensations are introduced
as elements of an explanatory account of the occurrence in various
circumstances of perceptual cognitions, having determinate semantic
contents:
. . . the hero . . . postulates a class of inner - theoretical
- episodes which he calls, say, impressions, and which are the
end results of the impingement of physical objects and processes
on various parts of the body. . . (EPM,191)
This time, however, the model for Jones’s theory is not that of
functionally-individuated families of sentences, but rather "a
domain of ‘inner replicas’ which, when brought about in standard
conditions share the perceptible characteristics of their physical
sources". (EPM,191) The leading idea of this model is the
occurrence, ‘in’ perceivers of "replicas" per se,
not of perceivings of "replicas" (which would mistakenly
inject into the account of impressions the intentionality of thought),
and, although the entities of this model are particulars,
the entities introduced by the theory are not particulars but
rather states of a perceiving subject. Thus, although talk of
the "of-ness" of sensations, like that of the "of-ness"
of thoughts is, on Sellars’ view, fundamentally classificatory,
the classification at issue is based not on a functional (logical,
semantic) analogy but rather on analogies that, although in the
first instance extrinsic and causal, ultimately attribute to sensations
a determinate intrinsic content. The specific point of the model
is to insist that states of, e.g., sensing [red triangle]ly (to
highlight the status of ‘sensation’ as a "verbal noun"),
characteristically brought about in normal perceivers in standard
conditions by the action of red triangular objects on the eyes,
can discharge their explanatory jobs in relation to cognitive
perceptual takings (especially non-veridical perceptual judgments)
only if they are conceived as resembling and differing from other
sensory states - e.g., sensing [green triangular]ly, sensing [red
square]ly, etc. - in a manner formally analogous to the way in
which objects of the "replica" model - e.g., red and
triangular, green and triangular, and red and square "wafers"
- are conceived to resemble and differ from one another.
If that were the end of Sellars’ ontological story regarding sensations,
matters would be complicated enough. But Sellars proceeds to develop
this core account in a variety of different directions, in consequence
of which his full theory of sensations has emerged as being one
of the most difficult and controversial aspects of his philosophy.
The first complication of Sellars’ theory of sensation results
from his conviction that, in the case of sensations, Jones’s theory
is interpretive. It does not introduce new domains of entities,
but rather reinterprets the categorial/ontological status of sensory
contents as states of perceivers. The crux of the original Jonesean
theory that the very color quanta of which we are perceptually
aware as existing in space are instead actually states
of persons-qua-perceivers. Already within the manifest image,
then, the ontological status ultimately accorded to sensory "content
qualia" is incompatible with their being instantiated in
physical space.
The second complication of Sellars’ theory of sensations arises from
the further conclusion that it is this manifest image conception of
sensory contents as states of perceivers which must ultimately be
synoptically "fused" with the scientific image, and that the
latter’s commitment to the idea that those perceivers themselves are
complex systems of micro-physical particles constitutes a barrier to
doing so in any straightforward way. Sellars notoriously concludes
that sensory contents can be synoptically integrated into the
scientific image only after both they and the currently-fundamental
micro-physical particulars of that image as well undergo yet another
categorial transposition into a categorially monistic ontology whose
fundamental entities are all "absolute processes". Sensings
qua absolute processes would then be physical, he writes,
. . . not only in the weak sense of not being mental (i.e.,
conceptual), for they lack intentionality, but in the richer sense of
playing a genuine causal role in the behavior of sentient
organisms. They would, as I have used the terms, be physical-l but not
physical-2. Not being epiphenomenal, they would conform to a basic
metaphysical intuition: to be is to make a difference. (CL,III,126)
Lengthy as this discussion has been, it only begins to capture
the scope, depth, and systematic character of Sellars’s philosophical
accomplishments. Many themes from his work have simply gone unmentioned
- his insightful analysis of predication and correlative nominalistic
alternative to classical Platonistic categorial ontology, his
sophisticated account of induction as a form of vindicatory practical
reasoning, his significant contributions to ethical theory and
the theory of action, and his masterful interpretations of the
work of many of the discipline’s great historical figures, not
as scholarly museum exhibits, but always as active participants
in a continuing philosophical conversation. The bibliographies
and Internet resources listed below will point the way to both
more comprehensive and more detailed accounts of the work of this
towering philosophical figure of the postwar era.
Books
- Pure Pragmatics and Possible Worlds-The Early Essays of Wilfrid
Sellars, [PPPW], ed. by Jeffrey F. Sicha, (Ridgeview Publishing
Co; Atascadero, CA; 1980). [Contains a long introductory essay by
Sicha and an extensive bibliography of Sellars’ work through 1979.]
- Science, Perception and Reality, [SPR], (Routledge &
Kegan Paul Ltd; London, and The Humanities Press: New York; 1963)
[Reissued in 1991 by Ridgeview Publishing Co., Atascadero, CA. This
edition contains a complete bibliography of Sellars’ published work
through 1989.]
- Philosophical Perspectives, [PP], (Charles C. Thomas:
Springfield, IL; 1967). Reprinted in two volumes, Philosophical
Perspectives: History of Philosophy and Philosophical
Perspective: Metaphysics and Epistemology, (Ridgeview Publishing
Co.; Atascadero, CA; 1977).
- Science and Metaphysics: Variations on Kantian Themes.
[S&M], (Routledge & Kegan Paul Ltd; London, and The Humanities
Press; New York; 1968). The 1966 John Locke Lectures. [Reissued in
1992 by Ridgeview Publishing Co., Atascadero, CA. This edition
contains a complete bibliography of Sellars’ published work through
1989, a register of Sellars’s philosophical correspondence, and a
listing of circulated but unpublished papers and lectures.]
- Essays in Philosophy and Its History, [EPH], (D. Reidel
Publishing Co.; Dordrecht, Holland; 1975).
- Naturalism and Ontology, [N&O], (Ridgeview Publishing
Co.; Atascadero, CA: 1979). [An expanded version of the 1974 John
Dewey Lectures]
- The Metaphysics of Epistemology, Lectures by Wilfrid Sellars,
edited by Pedro Amaral, (Ridgeview Publishing Co.; Atascadero,
CA; 1989). [Contains a complete bibliography of Sellars’ published
work through 1989.]
Selected Essays
- [AAE], "Actions and Events", Noûs 7, 1973,
pp. 179-202.
- [AE], "Abstract Entities", Review of
Metaphysics 16, 1983; reprinted in [PP], pp. 229-69.
- [CDCM], "Counterfactuals, Dispositions, and the Causal
Modalities", in Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of
Science, Vol. II, ed. by H. Feigl, M. Scriven, and G. Maxwell,
(University of Minnesota Press; Minneapolis, MN: 1957), pp. 225-308.
- [CL], "Foundations for a Metaphysics of Pure Process",
The Carus Lectures for 1977-78, published in The Monist 64,
No. 1, 1981.
- [EAE], "Empiricism and Abstract Entities", in The
Philosophy of Rudolph Carnap, ed. by P.A. Schilpp (Open Court;
LaSalle, IL; 1963); reprinted in [EPH], pp. 245-86.
- [EPM], "Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind", in
The Foundations of Science and the Concepts of Psychoanalysis,
Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. I, ed. by
H. Feigl and M. Scriven (University of Minnesota Press; Minneapolis,
MN; 1956); reprinted in [SPR], pp. 127-96).
- [FD], "Fatalism and Determinism", in Keith Lehrer, ed.,
Freedom and Determinism, (Random House; New York, NY: 1966),
pp. 141-74.
- [GEC], "Givenness and Explanatory Coherence", Journal
of Philosophy 70, 1973, pp. 612-24.
- [I], "…this I or he or it (the thing) which
thinks", the 1970 Presidential Address, American Philosophical
Association (Eastern Division), reprinted in [EPH].
- [IAMBP], "The Identity Approach to the Mind-Body
Problem", Review of Metaphysics 18, 1965; reprinted in
[PP], pp. 370-88.
- [IKTE], "The Role of Imagination in Kant’s Theory of
Experience", The 1977 Dotterer Lecture, in H.W. Johnstone, Jr.,
ed., Categories: A Colloquium, (Pennsylvania State University
Press: 1977), pp. 231-45.
- [IV], "Induction as Vindication", Philosophy of
Science 31, 1964; reprinted in [EPH], pp. 367-416.
- [ISRT], "Is Scientific Realism Tenable", Proceedings
of the PSA, Volume 2, 1976, pp. 307-34.
- [KTE], "Some Remarks on Kant’s Theory of Experience",
Journal of Philosophy 64, 1967, pp. 633-47.
- [LT], "The Language of Theories", in Current Issues
in the Philosophy Science, ed. by H. Feigl and G. Maxwell (Henry
Holt, Rhinehart and Winston; New York, NY; 1961): reprinted in [SPR],
pp. 106-26.
- [LTC],"Language as Thought and Communication",
Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 29. 1969; reprinted in
[EPH], pp. 93-117.
- [MFC], "Meaning as Functional Classification",
Synthese 27, 1974; pp. 417-37. (Issue also contains comments by
Daniel Dennett and Hilary Putnam and Sellars’s replies.)
- [MEV], "Mental Events", Philosophical Studies 81,
1981; pp. 325-45.
- [MGEC], "More on Givenness and Explanatory Coherence",
in George S. Pappas, ed., Justification and Knowledge,
(D. Reidel Publishing Co.; Dordrecht, Holland: 1979), pp. 169-82.
- [NDL], "Are There Non-Deductive Logics?", in N. Rescher
et al, eds., Essays in Honor of Carl G. Hempel, Synthese
Library, (D. Reidel Publishing Co.; Dordrecht, Holland: 1970),
pp. 83-103.
- [OAFP], "On Accepting First Principles", in
J. Tomberlin, ed., Philosophical Perspectives 2: Epistemology,
1988, (Ridgeview Publishing Co.; Atascadero, CA: 1988),
pp. 301-14.
- [P], "Phenomenalism", in [SPR], pp. 60-105.
- [PSIM], "Philosophy and the Scientific Image of Man", in
Frontiers of Science and Philosophy, ed. by Robert Colodny
(University of Pittsburgh Press; Pittsburgh, PA; 1962); reprinted in
[SPR], pp. 1-40.
- [SK], "The Structure of Knowledge", The Matchette
Foundation Lectures for 1971, published in Castañeda, ed.,
Action, Knowledge, and Reality (see below).
- [SSMB], "A Semantical Solution of the Mind-Body
Problem", Methodos 5, 1953, pp. 45-82. Reprinted in
[PPPW].
- [TA], "Thought and Action", in Keith Lehrer, ed.,
Freedom and Determinism, (Random House; New York, NY: 1966),
pp. 105-39.
- [TWO], "Time and the World Order", in Minnesota
Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. III, ed. by H.
Feigl and G. Maxwell, (University of Minnesota Press; Minneapolis,
MN: 1962), pp. 527-616.
Major Critical Studies
- Castañeda, H-N., ed. Action, Knowledge, and Reality
[AK&R] (Bobbs-Merrill; Indianapolis, IN; 1975). [Also
contains an extensive bibliography of Sellars’ work through 1974,
Sellars’ intellectual autobiography, and ‘The Structure of Knowledge’
(see below).]
- Delaney, C.F., Michael J. Loux, Gary Gutting, and W. David
Solomon, The Synoptic Vision: Essays on the Philosophy of Wilfrid
Sellars (University of Notre Dame Press; Notre Dame. IN; 1977).
[Also contains an extensive bibliography.]
- Pitt, Joseph C., ed., The Philosophy of Wilfrid Sellars:
Queries and Extensions [PSQE] (D. Reidel Publishing Co; Dordrecht,
Holland; 1978). [Revised proceedings of a workshop on the Philosophy
of Wilfrid Sellars held at Virginia Polytechnic Institute and State
University in Blacksburg, VA, in November 1976.]
- Pitt, Joseph C., Pictures, Images, and Conceptual Change: An
Analysis of Wilfrid Sellars’ Philosophy of Science (D. Reidel
Publishing Co.; Dordrecht, Holland; 1981).
- Seibt, Johanna, Properties as Processes, A Synoptic
Study of Wilfrid Sellars’ Nominalism", (Ridgeview Publishing
Co.; Atascadero, CA; 1990.
- Noûs, Vol. 7, No. 2, 1973. [Special issue devoted to
the philosophy of Wilfrid Sellars.]
- The Monist, Vol. 65, No. 3, 1982. [Issue devoted to the
philosophy of Wilfrid Sellars.]
- Philosophical Studies, Vol. 54, No. 2, 1988. [Revised
proceedings of the colloquium on Sellars’ philosophy held in October
1987 at the University of Pittburgh’s Center for Philosophy of
Science.]
Supplementary Bibliography
- Alanen, L., "Thought-Talk: Descartes and Sellars
on Intentionality", American Philosophical Quarterly,
29, 1992, pp. 19-34.
- Aune, Bruce, "Sellars’s Two Images of the World",
Journal of Philosophy, 87, 1990, pp. 537-45.
- Bernstein, Richard J., "Sellars’ Vision of
Man-in-the-Universe", Review of Metaphysics, 20, 1965-66,
pp. 290-316.
- Brandom, Robert, Making It Explicit, (Harvard
University Press; Cambridge, MA; 1995).
- Clark, Romane, "Sensibility and Understanding: The
Given of Wilfrid Sellars", The Monist, 65, 1982, 350-64.
- Cornman, James, "Sellars, Scientific Realism, and
Sensa", Review of Metaphysics, 23, 1969-70, pp. 417-51.
- ____________, "Sellars on Scientific Realism and
Perceiving", in Proceedings of the PSA, Volume 2, ed. by
F. Suppe and P.D. Asquith, 1976, pp. 344-58.
- Dennett, Daniel C.,[MTE], "Mid-Term Examination:
Compare and Contrast", in The Intentional Stance (Bradford
Books, The MIT Press; Cambridge, MA; 1987), pp. 339-50.
- Echelbarger, Charles, "Sellars on Thinking and the
Myth of the Given", Philosophical Studies 25, 1974,
pp. 231-46.
- Geiger, L., Die Logik der seelischen Ereignisse. Zu
Theorien von L. Wittgenstein und W. Sellars, (Suhrkamp Verlag;
Frankfurt/M: 1969).
- Habermas, Juergen, "Sprachspiel, Intention und
Bedeutung. Zu Motiven bei Sellars und Wittgenstein", in
Wiggerhaus, R., (ed.), Sprachanalyse und Soziologie. Die
sozialwissenschalfliche Relevanz von Wittgensteins
Sprachphilosophie, (Suhrkamp Verlag; Frankfurt/M: 1975),
pp. 319-40.
- Harman, Gilbert H., "Sellars’ Semantics",
The Philosophical Review 79, 1970, pp. 404-19.
- Hooker, C.A., "Sellars’ Argument for the Inevitability
of the Secondary Qualities", Philosophical Studies 32,
1977, pp. 335-48.
- Koch, Anton F., Vernunft und Sinnlichkeit im praktischen
Denken. Eine sprachbehavioristische Rekonstruktion Kantisher Theoreme
gegen Sellars, (Verlag Königshausen + Neumann; Würzburg:
1980).
- Kurthen, M., "Qualia, Sensa und Absolute Prozesse. Zu
W. Sellars’ Kritik des psychocerebalen Reduktionismus",
Journal for General Philosophy of Science (Zeitschrift für
Allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie), 21, 1990, 25-41.
- Marras, Antonio, "Sellars on Thought and
Language", Noûs 7, 1973, pp. 152-63.
- ____________, "On Sellars’ Linguistic Theory of Conceptual
Activity", Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 2, 1973,
pp. 471-83.
- ____________, "Reply to Sellars", Canadian Journal of
Philosophy, 2, 1973, pp. 495-501.
- ____________, "Sellars’ Behaviourism: A Reply to Fred
Wilson", Philosophical Studies, 30, 1976, pp. 413-18.
- McGilvray, J.A., "Pure Process(es)?",
Philosophical Studies 43, 1983, pp. 243-51.
- Meyers, R.G., "Sellars’ Rejection of
Foundations", Philosophical Studies, 39, 1981, pp. 61-78.
- Pohlenz, G., "Phänomenale Realität und
naturalistische Philosophie. Eine systematische Widerlegung der
Feigl’schen und Sellars’schen Theorien phänomenaler
Qualitäten und Skizze einer alternativen Theorie",
Zeitschrift für philosophische Forschung, 44, 1990,
106-42.
- Richardson, R.C. and Muilenburg, G., "Sellars and
Sense Impressions", Erkenntnis, 17, 1982, pp. 171-211.
- Rosenberg, Jay F., "The Elusiveness of Categories, the
Archimedean Dilemma, and the Nature of Man", in Castañeda,
ed., [AK&R] (see above), pp. 147-84.
- ____________, "Linguistic Roles and Proper Names", in
Pitt, [PSQE] (see above), pp. 189-216.
- ____________, "The Place of Color in the Scheme of Things: A
Roadmap to Sellars’ Carus Lectures", The Monist, 65, 3,
1982, pp. 315-35.
- ____________, "Wilfrid Sellars’ Philosophy of Mind" in
Contemporary Philosophy, 4: Philosophy of Mind, ed. by Guttorm
Floistad, (Martinus Nijhoff Publishers; 1983), pp. 417-39.
- ____________, [FI] "Fusing the Images: Nachruf for Wilfrid
Sellars", Journal for General Philosophy of Science
(Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie),
Vol. XXI, No. 1, 1990, pp. 3-25.
- ____________, "Response to Aune, "Sellars’ Two Images of
the World"", (Abstract), The Journal of Philosophy,
Vol. 87, No. 10, October, 1990, pp. 546-7.
- Rottschaefer, W.A., "Verbal Behaviorism and
Theoretical Mentalism: An Assessment of the Marras-Sellars
Dialogue", Philosophical Research Archives, 9, 1983,
pp. 511-33.
- Seibt, Johanna, "Analysis without synopsis must be
blind. Obituary for W. Sellars", Erkenntnis, 33, 1990,
pp. 5-8.
- ____________, "Wilfrid Sellars’ systematischer
Nominalismus", Information Philosophie, 3, 1995, pp. 22-6.
- Sicha, Jeffrey, The Metaphysics of Elementary
Mathematics, (University of Massachusetts Press; Amherst, MA:
1974).
- Smart, J.J.C., "Sellars on Process", The
Monist 65, 1982, pp. 302-14.
- Tye, Michael, "The Adverbial Theory: A Defense of
Sellars against Jackson", Metaphilosophy, 6, 1975,
pp. 136-43.
- van Fraassen, Bas C., "Wilfrid Sellars on Scientific
Realism", Dialogue 14, 1975, pp. 606-16.
- ____________, "On the Radical Incompleteness of the Manifest
Image", Proceedings of the PSA, Volume 2, ed. by F. Suppe
and P.D. Asquith, 1976, pp. 335-43.
- Vinci, T., "Sellars and the Adverbial Theory of
Sensation", Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 11, 1981,
pp. 199-217.
- Wilson, Fred, "Marras on Sellars on Thought and
Language", Philosophical Studies, 28, 1975, pp. 91-102.
- Woods, M., "Sellars on Kantian Intuitions",
Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 44, 1984, pp.
413-18.
- Wright, E.L., "A Defense of Sellars", Philosophy
and Phenomenological Research, 46, 1985, pp. 73-90.
Carnap, Rudolf |
functionalism |
intentionality |
Kant, Immanuel |
language: philosophy of |
meaning |
mind: philosophy of |
Quine, Willard van Orman |
science, philosophy of
Copyright © 1997 by
Jay F. Rosenberg
jfr@email.unc.edu
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First published: February 22, 1997
Content last modified: February 22, 1997