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Relational Quantum Mechanics
Relational quantum mechanics is an interpretation of quantum theory
which discards the notions of absolute state of a system, absolute
value of its physical quantities, or absolute event. The theory
describes only the way systems affect each other in the course of
physical interactions. State and physical quantities refer
always to the interaction, or the relation, between two
systems. Nevertheless, the theory is assumed to be complete. The
physical content of quantum theory is understood as expressing the net
of relations connecting all different physical systems.
Quantum theory is our current general theory of physical
motion. The theory is the core component of the momentous
change that our understanding of the physical world has undergone
during the first decades of the 20th century. It is one of the most
successful scientific theories ever: it is supported by vast and
unquestionable empirical and technological effectiveness and is today
virtually unchallenged. But the interpretation of what the theory
actually tells us about the physical world raises a lively debate,
which has continued with alternating fortunes, from the early days of
the theory in the late twenties, to nowadays. The relational
interpretations are a number of reflections by different
authors, which were independently developed, but converge in
indicating an interpretation of the physical content of the
theory. The core idea is to read the theory as a theoretical account
of the way distinct physical systems affect each other when
they interact (and not of the way physical systems "are"), and the
idea that this account exhausts all that can be said about the
physical world. The physical world is thus seen as a net of
interacting components, where there is no meaning to the state of an
isolated system. A physical system (or, more precisely, its
contingent state) is reduced to the net of relations it entertains
with the surrounding systems, and the physical structure of the world
is identified as this net of relationships.
The possibility that the physical content of an empirically
successful physical theory could be debated should not surprise:
examples abound in the history of science. For instance, the great
scientific revolution was fueled by the grand debate on whether the
effectiveness of the Copernican system could be taken as an
indication that the Earth was not in fact at the
center of the universe. In more recent times, Einstein's
celebrated first major theoretical success, special relativity,
consisted to a large extent just in understanding the physical
meaning (simultaneity is relative) of an already existing effective
mathematical formalism (the Lorentz transformations). In these cases,
as in the case of quantum mechanics, a very strictly empiricist
position could have circumvented the problem altogether, by reducing
the content of the theory to a list of predicted numbers. But perhaps
science can offer us more than such a list; and certainly science
needs more than such a list to find its ways.
The difficulty in the interpretation of quantum mechanics derives
from the fact that the theory was first constructed for describing
microscopic systems (atoms, electrons, photons) and the way these
interact with macroscopic apparatuses built to measure their
properties. Such interactions are denoted as "measurements". The
theory consists in a mathematical formalism, which allows
probabilities of alternative outcomes of such measurements to be
calculated. If used just for this purpose, the theory raises no
difficulty. But we expect the macroscopic apparatuses themselves --
in fact, any physical system in the world -- to obey quantum theory,
and this seems to raise contradictions in the theory.
In classical mechanics, a system S is described by a certain
number of physical variables. For instance, an electron is described
by its position and its spin (intrinsic angular momentum). These
variables change with time and represent the contingent properties of
the system. We say that their values determine, at every moment, the
"state" of the system. A measurement of a system's variable is
an interaction between the system S and an external system
O, whose effect on O, depends on the actual value
q of the variable (of S) which is measured. The
characteristic feature of quantum mechanics is that it does not allow
us to assume that all variables of the system have determined values
at every moment (this irrespectively of whether or not we know such
values). It was Werner Heisenberg who first realized the need to
free ourselves from the belief that, say, an electron has a well
determined position at every time. When it is not interacting with an
external system that can detect its position, the electron can be
"spread out" over different positions. In the jargon of the theory,
one says that the electron is in a "quantum superposition" of two (or
many) different positions. It follows that the state of the system
cannot be captured by giving the value of its variables. Instead,
quantum theory introduces a new notion of "state" of a system, which
is different from a list of values of its variables. Such a new
notion of state was developed in the work of Erwin Schrödinger
in the form of the "wave function" of the system, usually denoted by
.
Paul Adrien Maurice Dirac gave a general abstract formulation of the
notion of quantum state, in terms of a vector
moving in an abstract vector space. The time evolution of the state
is deterministic and is governed by the
Schrödinger equation. From the knowledge of the state
,
one can compute the probability of the different measurement
outcomes q. That is, the probability of the different ways
in which the system S can affect a system O in
an interaction with it. The theory then prescribes that at every such
‘measurement’, one must update the value of
,
to take into account which of the different outcomes has
happened. This sudden change of the state
depends on the specific outcome of the measurement and is therefore
probabilistic. It is called the "collapse of the wave function".
The problem of the interpretation of quantum mechanics takes then
different forms, depending on the relative ontological weight we choose
to assign to the wave function
or, respectively, to the sequence of the measurement outcomes
q,
q
,
q
,
…. If we take
as the "real" entity which fully represents the actual state of affairs
of the world, we encounter a number of difficulties. First, we have to
understand how
can change suddenly in the course of a measurement: if we describe the
evolution of two interacting quantum systems in terms of the
Schrödinger equation, no collapse happens. Furthermore, the
collapse, seen as a physical process, seems to depend on arbitrary
choices in our description and shows a disturbing amount of
nonlocality. But even if we can circumvent the collapse problem, the
more serious difficulty of this point of view is that it appears to
be impossible to understand how specific observed values q,
q,
q,
… can emerge from the same
.
A better alternative is to take the observed values q,
q,
q,
… as the actual elements of reality, and view
just as a bookkeeping device, determined by the actual values
q,
q,
q,
… that happened in past. From this perspective, the real events
of the world are the "realization" (the "coming to reality", the
"actualization") of the values q,
q,
q,
… in the course of the interaction between
physical systems. This actualization of a variable q
in the course of an interaction can be denoted as the quantum
event q. An exemple of a quantum event is the
detection of an electron in a certain position. The position variable
of the electron assumes a determined value in the course of
the interaction between the electron and an external system and
the quantum event is the "manifestation" of the electron in a
certain position. Quantum events have an intrinsically discrete
("quantized") granular structure.
The difficulty of this second option is that if we take the quantum
nature of all physical systems into account, the statement that a
certain specific event q "has happened" (or, equivalently
that a certain variable has or has not taken the value
q) can be true and not-true at the same time. To clarify
this key point, consider the case in which a system S
interacts with another system (an apparatus) O, and exhibits
a value q of one of its variables. Assume that the system
O obeys the laws of quantum theory as well, and use the
quantum theory of the combined system formed by O and
S in order to predict the way this combined system can later
interact with a third system
O.
Then quantum mechanics forbids us to assume
that q has happened. Indeed, as far as its later behavior is
concerned, the combined system S+O may very well be in a
quantum superposition of alternative possible values q,
q,
q,
…. This "second observer" situation captures the core conceptual
difficulty of the interpretation of quantum mechanics: reconciling
the possibility of quantum superposition with the fact that the
observed world is characterized by uniquely determined events
q,
q,
q,
…. More precisely, it shows that we cannot disentangle the two:
according to the theory an observed quantity (q) can be at
the same time determined and not determined. An event may have happened and
at the same time may not have happened.
The way out from this dilemma suggested by the relational
interpretation is that the quantum events, and thus the values of the
variables of a physical system S, namely the q's, are
relational. That is, they do not express properties of the system S
alone, but rather refer to the relation between two systems. In
particular, the central tenet of relational quantum
mechanics (Rovelli 1996, 1997) is that there is no meaning in
saying that a certain quantum event has happened or that a variable
of the system S has taken the value q: rather,
there is meaning in saying that the event q has happened or
the variable has taken the value q for O,
or with respect to O. The apparent contradiction
between the two statements that a variable has or hasn't a value
is resolved by indexing the statements with the different systems
with which the system in question interacts. If I observe an
electron at a certain position, I cannot conclude that the electron
is there: I can only conclude that the electron as seen
by me is there. Quantum events only happen in interactions
between systems, and the fact that a quantum event has happened is
only true with respect to the systems involved in the interaction.
The unique account of the state of the world of the classical theory
is thus fractured into a multiplicity of accounts, one for each
possible "observing" physical system. In the words of (Rovelli 1996):
"Quantum mechanics is a theory about the physical description of
physical systems relative to other systems, and this is a complete
description of the world".
This relativisation of actuality is viable thanks to a remarkable
property of the formalism of quantum mechanics. John von Neumann was
the first to notice that the formalism of the theory treats the
measured system (S ) and the measuring system (O)
differently, but the theory is surprisingly flexible on the choice of
where to put the boundary between the two. Different choices give
different accounts of the state of the world (for instance, the
collapse of the wave function happens at different times); but this
does not affect the predictions on the final observations. Von Neumann
only described a rather special situation, but this
flexibility reflects a general structural property of quantum theory,
which guarantees the consistency among all the distinct "accounts of
the world" of the different observing systems. The manner in which
this consistency is realized, however, is subtle.
What appears with respect to O as a measurement of the
variable q (with a specific outcome), appears with respect
to
O
simply as the establishing of a correlation between
S and O (without any specific outcome). As far as
the observer O is concerned, a quantum event has happened and a
property q of a
system S has taken a certain value. As far as the second
observer
O
is concerned, the only relevant element of reality is that a
correlation is established between S and O.
This correlation will manifest itself only in any further
observation that
O
would perform on the S+O system. Up to the time in which
it physically interacts with S+O, the system
O
has no access to the actual outcomes of the measurements performed
by O on S . This actual outcome is real only with
respect to O (Rovelli 1996, pp. 1650-52). Consider for
instance a two-state system O (say, a light-emitting diode,
or l.e.d., which can be on or off) interacting with
a two-state system S (say, the spin of an electron, which
can be up or down). Assume the interaction is such
that if the spin is up (down) the l.e.d. goes
on (off). To start with, the electron can be in a
superposition of its two states. In the account of the state of the
electron that we can associate with the l.e.d., a quantum event
happens in the interaction, the wave function of the electron
collapses to one of two states, and the l.e.d. is then either
on or off. But we can also consider the
l.e.d./electron composite system as a quantum system and study the
interactions of this composite system with another system
O.
In the account associated to
O,
there is no event and no collapse at the time of the interaction,
and the composite system is still in the superposition of the two
states [spin up/l.e.d. on] and [spin
down/l.e.d. off] after the interaction. It is
necessary to assume this superposition because it accounts for
measurable interference effects between the two states: if quantum
mechanics is correct, these interference effects are truly observable
by
O.
So, we have two discordant accounts of the same events. Can the two
discord accounts be compared and does the comparison lead to
contradiction? They can be compared, because the information on the
first account is stored in the state of the l.e.d. and
O
has access to this information. Therefore O and
O
can compare their accounts of the state of the world.
However, the comparison does not lead to contradiction because
the comparison is itself a physical process that must be understood
in the context of quantum mechanics. Indeed,
O
can physically interact with the electron and then with the l.e.d. (or,
equivalently, the other way around). If, for instance, he finds the
spin of the electron up, quantum mechanics predicts that he
will then consistently find the l.e.d. on (because in the first
measurement the state of the composite system collapses on its [spin
up/l.e.d. on] component). That is, the multiplicity of
accounts leads to no contradiction precisely because the comparison
between different accounts can only be a physical quantum
interaction. This internal self-consistency of the quantum formalism
is general, and it is perhaps its most remarkable aspect. This self
consistency is taken in relational quantum mechanics as a
strong indication of the relational nature of the world.
In fact, one may conjecture that this peculiar consistency between
the observations of different observers is the missing ingredient for
a reconstruction theorem of the Hilbert space formalism of quantum
theory. Such a reconstruction theorem is still unavailable: On the
basis of reasonable physical assumptions, one is able to derive the
structure of an orthomodular lattice containing subsets that form
Boolean algebras, which "almost", but not quite, implies the
existence of a Hilbert space and its projectors'
algebra (see the entry Quantum Logic and Quantum Probability.)
Perhaps an appropriate algebraic formulation of the
condition of consistency between subsystems could provide the missing
hypothesis to complete the reconstruction theorem.
The conceptual relevance of correlations in quantum mechanics,
- a central aspect of relational quantum mechanics -- is emphasized by
David Mermin, who analyses the statistical features of correlation
(Mermin 1998), and arrives at views close to the relational ones.
Mermin points out that a theorem on correlations in
Hilbert space quantum mechanics is relevant to the problem of what
exactly quantum theory tells us about the physical world. Consider a
quantum system S with internal parts
s, s,…,
that may be considered as subsystems of S , and define the
correlations among subsystems as the expectation values of products
of subsystems' observables. It can be proved that, for any
resolution of S into subsystems, the subsystems'
correlations determine uniquely the state of
S. According to Mermin, this theorem highlights two major
lessons that quantum mechanics teaches us: first, the relevant
physics of S is entirely contained in the correlations both
among the s,
s,…,
themselves (internal correlations) and among the
s,…,
and other systems (external correlations);
second, correlations may be ascribed physical reality whereas,
according to well-known ‘no-go’ theorems, the quantities
that are the terms of the correlations cannot (Mermin 1998).
From a relational point of view, the properties of a system exists
only in reference to another system. What about the properties of a
system with respect to itself? Can a system measure itself? Is there
any meaning of the correlations of a system with itself? Implicit in
the relational point of view is the intuition that a complete
self-measurement is impossible. It is this impossibility that forces
all properties to be referred to another system. The issue of the
self-measurement has been analyzed in details in two remarkable
works, from very different perspectives, but with similar
conclusions, by Marisa Dalla Chiara and by Thomas Breuer.
Marisa Dalla Chiara (1977) has addressed the logical aspect
of the measurement problem. She observes that the problem of
self-measurement in quantum mechanics is strictly related to the
self-reference problem, which has an old tradition in logic.
From a logical point of view the measurement problem of quantum
mechanics can be described as a characteristic question of
"semantical closure" of a theory. To what extent can quantum
mechanics apply consistently to the objects and the concepts in terms
of which its metatheory is expressed? Dalla Chiara shows that the
duality in the description of state evolution, encoded in the
ordinary (i.e. von Neumann's) approach to the measurement
problem, can be given a purely logical interpretation: "If the
apparatus observer O is an object of the theory, then
O cannot realize the reduction of the wave function. This is
possible only to another
O,
which is ‘external’ with respect to the universe of the
theory. In other words, any apparatus, as a particular physical
system, can be an object of the theory. Nevertheless, any
apparatus which realizes the reduction of the wave function is
necessarily only a metatheoretical object " (Dalla Chiara 1977,
p. 340). This observation is remarkably consistent with the way in
which the state vector reduction is justified within the relational
interpretation of quantum mechanics. When the system S+O is
considered from the point of view of
O,
the measurement can be seen as an interaction whose dynamics is
fully unitary, whereas by the point of view of O the
measurement breaks the unitarity of the evolution of S. The
unitary evolution does not break down through mysterious physical
jumps, due to unknown effects, but simply because O is not
giving a full dynamical description of the interaction. O
cannot have a full description of the interaction of S with
himself (O), because his information is correlation
information and there is no meaning in being correlated with oneself.
If we include the observer into the system, then the evolution is
still unitary, but we are now dealing with the description of a
different observer.
As is well known, from a purely logical point of view self-reference
properties in formal systems impose limitations on the descriptive
power of the systems themselves. Thomas Breuer has shown that, from a
physical point of view, this feature is expressed by the existence of
limitations in the universal validity of physical theories, no
matter whether classical or quantum (Breuer 1995). Breuer
studies the possibility for an apparatus O to measure its
own state. More precisely, of measuring the state of a system
containing an apparatus O. He defines a map from
the space of all sets of states of the apparatus to the space of all
sets of states of the system. Such a map assigns to every set of
apparatus states the set of system states that is compatible with the
information that -- after the measurement interaction -- the
apparatus is in one of these states. Under reasonable assumptions on
this map, Breuer is able to prove a theorem stating that no such map
can exist that can distinguish all the states of the system. An
apparatus O cannot distinguish all the states of a system
S containing O. This conclusion holds irrespective
of the classical or quantum nature of the systems involved, but in
the quantum context it implies that no quantum mechanical apparatus
can measure all the quantum correlations between itself and
an external system. These correlations are only measurable by a
second external apparatus, observing both the system and the first
apparatus.
A relational view of quantum mechanics has been proposed also by
Gyula Bene (1997). Bene argues that quantum states are relative in
the sense that they express a relation between a system to be
described and a different system, containing the former as a
subsystem and acting for it as a quantum reference system
(here the system is contained in the reference system, while in
Breuer's work the system contains the apparatus). Consider again
a measuring system (O) that has become entangled with a
measured system (S ) during a measurement. Once again, the
difficulty of quantum theory is that there is an apparent
contradiction between the fact that the quantity q of the
system assumes an observed value in the measurement, while the
composite S+O system still has to be considered in a
superposition state, if we want to properly predict the outcome of
measurements on the S+O system. This apparent contradiction
is resolved by Bene by relativizing the state not to an observer, as
in the relational quantum mechanics sketched in Section 2, but rather
to a relevant composite system. That is: there is a state of the
system S relative to S alone, and a state of the
system S relative to the S+O composite
system. (Similarly, there is a state of the system O
relative to itself alone, and a state of the system O
relative to the S+O ensemble.) The ensemble with respect to
which the state is defined is called by Bene the quantum
reference system . The state of a system with respect to a given
quantum reference system correctly predicts the probability
distributions of any measurement on the entire reference system. This
dependence of the states of quantum systems from different quantum
systems that act as reference systems is viewed as a fundamental
property that holds no matter whether a system is observed or not.
Similar views have been expressed by Simon Kochen in unpublished but
rather well-known notes (Kochen, 1979). In Kochen's words: "The basic
change in the classical framework which we advocate lies in dropping
the assumption of the absoluteness of physical properties of
interacting systems... Thus quantum mechanical properties acquire an
interactive or relational character." Kochen uses a
-algebra
formalism. Each quantum system has an associated Hilbert space. The
properties of the system are established by its interaction with
other quantum systems, and these properties are represented by the
corresponding projection operators on the Hilbert space. These
projectors are elements of a Boolean
-algebra,
determined by the physics of the interaction between the two
systems. Suppose a quantum system S can interact with
quantum systems Q,
Q,….
In each case, S will acquire an interaction
-algebra of properties
(Q),
(Q)
since the interaction between
S and Q may be finer grained than the interaction
between S and
Q.
Thus, interaction
-algebras
may have non-trivial intersections. The family of all
Boolean
-algebras
forms a category, with the sets of the projectors of each
-algebra
as objects. In Kochen's words: "Just as the state of a
composite system does not determine states of its components,
conversely, the states of the... correlated systems do not determine
the state of the composite system [...] We thus resolve the
measurement problem by cutting the Gordian knot tying the states of
component systems uniquely to the state of the combined system." This
is very similar in spirit to the Bene approach. The precise
relation between Kochen's approach and Rovelli's
relational quantum mechanics has been analysed by Bill Curry
(1999).
Further approaches at least formally related to Kochen's have
been proposed by Healey (1989), who also emphasises an interactive
aspect of his approach, and by Dieks (1989). See also the entry on
’Modal Interpretations of Quantum Mechanics’.
Relational views on quantum theory have been defended also
by Lee Smolin (1995) and by Louis Crane (1995) in a cosmological
context. If one is interested in the quantum theory of the entire
universe, then, by definition, an external observer is not
available. Breuer's theorem shows then that a quantum state of
the universe, containing all correlations between all subsystems,
expresses information that is not available, not even in principle,
to any observer. In order to write a meaningful quantum state, argue
Crane and Smolin, we have to divide the universe in two components
and consider the relative quantum state predicting the outcomes of
the observations that one component can make on the other.
Relational ideas underlie also the interpretations of quantum theory
inspired by the work of Everett. Everett' original work
(Everett 1975) relies on the notion of "relative state" and has a
marked relational tone (see
quantum mechanics: Everett's relative-state formulation of).
In the context of Everettian accounts, a state may be taken as
relative either (more commonly) to a "world", or "branch", or
(sometimes) to the state of another system (see for instance Saunders
1996, 1998). While the first variant (relationalism with respect to
branches) is far from the relational views described here, the second
variant (relationalism with respect to the state of a system) is
closer.
However, it is different to say that something is relative to a
system or that something is relative to a state of a system.
Consider for instance the situation described in the example of
Section 5: According to the relational interpretation, after the
first measurement the quantity q has a given value and only
one for O, while in Everettian terms the quantity q
has a value for one state of O and a different value for
another state of O, and the two are equally real. In
Everett, there is an ontological multiplicity of realities, which is
absent in the relational point of view, where physisical quantities
are uniquely determined, once two systems are given.
The difference derives from a very general interpretational
difference between Everettian accounts and the relational point
of view. Everett (at least in its widespread version) takes the
state
as the basis of the ontology of quantum theory. The overall state
includes different possible branches and different possible
outcomes. On the other hand, the relational interpretation takes the
quantum events q, that is, the actualizations of values of
physical quantities, as the basic elements of reality (see Section
1.1 above) and such q's are assumed to be univocal.
The relational view avoids the traditional difficulties in taking the
q's as univocal simply by noticing that a q
does not refer to a system, but rather to a pair of systems.
For a comparison between the relational interpretation and other
current interpretations of quantum mechanics, see Rovelli 1996.
A number of open conceptual issues in quantum mechanics appear in a
different light when seen in the context of a relational
interpretation of the theory. For instance, the conventional
conclusions of the Einstein-Podolsky-Rosen argument turn out to be
frame-dependent, and this result supports the "peaceful coexistence"
of quantum mechanics and special relativity (Laudisa 2001). In
certain istances, the descriptions given in different Lorentz frames
can be identified with descriptions relative to different observer
systems, which are consistent in the sense of Section 2.
Also, the relational interpretation allows one to give a precise
definition of the time (or, better, the probability distribution of
the time) at which a measurement happens, in terms of the probability
distribution of the correlation between system and apparatus, as
measurable by a third observer (Rovelli 1998).
Finally, it has been suggested in (Rovelli 1997) that the
relationalism at the core of quantum theory pointed out by the
relational interpretations might be connected with the spatiotemporal
relationalism that characterizes general relativity. Quantum
mechanical relationalism is the observation that there are no
absolute properties: properties of a system S are relative
to another system O with which S is
interacting. General relativistic relationalism is the well known
observation that there is no absolute localization in spacetime:
localization of an object S in spacetime is only relative to
the gravitational field, or to any other object O, to which
S is contiguous. There is a connection between the two,
since interaction between S and O implies
contiguity and contiguity between S and O can only
be checked via some quantum interaction. However, because
of the difficulty of developing a consistent and conceptually
transparent theory of quantum gravity, so far this suggestion has not
been developed beyond the stage of a simple intuition.
Relational interpretations of quantum mechanics propose
a solution to the interpretational difficulties of quantum theory
based on the idea of weakening the notions of the state of
a system, event, and the idea that a system, at a certain
time, may just have a certain property. The world is described as
an ensemble of events ("the electron is the point x")
which happen only relatively to a given
observer. Accordingly, the state and the properties of a system
are relative to another system only. There is a wide
diversity in style, emphasis, and language in the authors that we
have mentioned. Indeed, most of the works mentioned have developed
independently from each other. But it is rather clear that there is a
common idea underlying all these approaches, and the convergence is
remarkable.
Werner Heisenberg first recognized that the electron does not have a
well defined position when it is not interacting. Relational
interpretations push this intuition further, by stating that, even
when interacting, the position of the electron is only determined in
relation to a certain observer, or to a certain quantum reference
system, or similar.
In physics, the move of deepening our insight into the physical world
by relativizing notions previously used as absolute has been applied
repeatedly and very successfully. Here are a few examples. The notion
of the velocity of an object has been recognized as meaningless,
unless it is indexed with a reference body with respect to which the
object is moving. With special relativity, simultaneity of two
distant events has been recognized as meaningless, unless referred to
a specific state of motion of something. (This something is usually
denoted as "the observer" without, of course, any implication that
the observer is human or has any other peculiar property besides
having a state of motion. Similarly, the "observer system" O
in quantum mechanics need not to be human or have any other property
beside the possibility of interacting with the "observed" system
S.) With general relativity, the position in space and time
of an object has been recognized as meaningless, unless it is
referred to the gravitational field, or to some other dynamical physical
entity. The move proposed by the relational interpretations of
quantum mechanics has strong analogies with these, but is, in a
sense, a longer jump, since all physical events and the entirety of the
contingent properties of any physical system are taken to be meaningful
only as relative to a second physical system. The claim of the relational
interpretations is that this is not an arbitrary move. Rather, it is
a conclusion which is difficult to escape, following from the
observation -- explained above in the example of the "second observer"
-- that a variable (of a system S) can have a well determined
value q for one observer (O) and at the same time
fail to have a determined value for another observer
(O).
This way of thinking the world has certainly heavy philosophical
implications. The claim of the relational interpretations is that it is
nature itself that is forcing us to this way of thinking. If we want to
understand nature, our task is not to frame nature into our
philosophical prejudices, but rather to learn how to adjust our
philosophical prejudices to what we learn from nature.
- Bene, G., "Quantum reference systems: a new framework for quantum
mechanics", PhysicaA 242 (1992): 529-560.
- Breuer, T., "The impossibility of accurate state
self-measurements", Philosophy of Science 62
(1993): 197-214.
- Crane, L., "Clock and Category: Is Quantum Gravity Algebraic?",
Journal of Mathematical Physics 36 (1993):
6180-6193.
- Dalla Chiara M.L., "Logical self-reference, set theoretical
paradoxes and the measurement problem in quantum mechanics",
Journal of Philosophical Logic 6 (1977):
331-347.
- Everett H., "‘Relative State’ Formulation of Quantum
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[Please contact the authors with suggestions.]
action at a distance |
properties |
quantum mechanics |
quantum mechanics: collapse theories |
quantum mechanics: Everett’s relative-state formulation of |
quantum mechanics: modal interpretations of |
quantum theory: measurement in |
quantum theory: quantum entanglement and information |
quantum theory: quantum logic and probability theory
Copyright © 2002 by
Federico Laudisa
federico.laudisa@unimib.it
and
Carlo Rovelli
rovelli@cpt.univ-mrs.fr
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First published: February 4, 2002
Content last modified: February 4, 2002