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Evolutionary Epistemology
Evolutionary Epistemology is a naturalistic approach to epistemology,
which emphasizes the importance of natural selection in two primary
roles. In the first role, selection is the generator and maintainer of
the reliability of our senses and cognitive mechanisms, as well as the
"fit" between those mechanisms and the world. In the second role, trial
and error learning and the evolution of scientific theories are
construed as selection processes.
Traditional epistemology has its roots in Plato and the ancient
skeptics. One strand emerges from Plato's interest in the problem of
distinguishing between knowledge and true belief. His solution was to
suggest that knowledge differs from true belief in being justified.
Ancient skeptics complained that all attempts to provide any such
justification were hopelessly flawed. Another strand emerges from the
attempt to provide a reconstruction of human knowledge showing how the
pieces of human knowledge fit together in a structure of mutual
support. This project got its modern stamp from Descartes and comes in
empiricist as well as rationalist versions which in turn can be given
either a foundational or coherentist twist. The two strands are woven
together by a common theme. The bonds that hold the reconstruction of
human knowledge together are the justificational and evidential
relations which enable us to distinguish knowledge from true belief.
The traditional approach is predicated on the assumption that
epistemological questions have to be answered in ways which do not
presuppose any particular knowledge. The argument is that any such
appeal would obviously be question begging. Such approaches may be
appropriately labeled "transcendental."
The Darwinian revolution of the nineteenth century suggested an
alternative approach first explored by Dewey and the pragmatists. Human
beings, as the products of evolutionary development, are natural
beings. Their capacities for knowledge and belief are also the products
of a natural evolutionary development. As such, there is some reason to
suspect that knowing, as a natural activity, could and should be
treated and analyzed along lines compatible with its status, i. e., by
the methods of natural science. On this view, there is no sharp
division of labor between science and epistemology. In particular, the
results of particular sciences such as evolutionary biology and
psychology are not ruled a priori irrelevant to the solution
of epistemological problems. Such approaches, in general, are called
naturalistic epistemologies, whether they are directly motivated by
evolutionary considerations or not. Those which are directly motivated
by evolutionary considerations and which argue that the growth of
knowledge follows the pattern of evolution in biology are called
"evolutionary epistemologies."
Evolutionary epistemology is the attempt to address questions in the
theory of knowledge from an evolutionary point of view. Evolutionary
epistemology involves, in part, deploying models and metaphors drawn
from evolutionary biology in the attempt to characterize and resolve
issues arising in epistemology and conceptual change. As disciplines
co-evolve, models are traded back and forth. Thus, evolutionary
epistemology also involves attempts to understand how biological
evolution proceeds by interpreting it through models drawn from our
understanding of conceptual change and the development of theories. The
term "evolutionary epistemology" was coined by Donald Campbell
(1974).
There are two interrelated but distinct programs which go by the name
"evolutionary epistemology." One focuses on the development of
cognitive mechanisms in animals and humans. This involves a
straightforward extension of the biological theory of evolution to
those aspects or traits of animals which are the biological substrates
of cognitive activity, e. g., their brains, sensory systems, motor
systems, etc. The other program attempts to account for the evolution
of ideas, scientific theories, epistemic norms and culture in general
by using models and metaphors drawn from evolutionary biology. Both
programs have their roots in 19th century biology and social
philosophy, in the work of Darwin, Spencer, James and others. There
have been a number of attempts in the intervening years to develop the
programs in detail (see Campbell 1974, Bradie 1986, Cziko 1995). Much
of the contemporary work in evolutionary epistemology derives from the
work of Konrad Lorenz (1977), Donald Campbell (1974, et. al.), Karl
Popper (1972, 1984) and Stephen Toulmin (1967, 1972).
The two programs have been labeled EEM and EET. (Bradie, 1986) EEM
is the label for the program which attempts to provide an evolutionary
account of the development of cognitive structures. EET is the label
for the program which attempts to analyze the development of human
knowledge and epistemological norms by appealing to relevant biological
considerations. Some of these attempts involve analyzing the growth of
human knowledge in terms of selectionist models and metaphors (e. g.,
Popper 1972, Toulmin 1972, Hull 1988). Others argue for a biological
grounding of epistemological norms and methodologies but eschew
selectionist models of the growth of human knowledge as such
(e. g., Ruse 1986, Rescher 1990).
The EEM and EET programs are interconnected but distinct. A
successful EEM selectionist explanation of the development of cognitive
brain structures provides no warrant, in itself, for extrapolating such
models to understand the development of human knowledge systems.
Similarly, endorsing an EET selectionist account of how human knowledge
systems grow does not, in itself, warrant concluding that specific or
general brain structures involved in cognition are the result of
natural selection for enhanced cognitive capacities. The two programs,
though similar in design and drawing upon the same models and
metaphors, do not stand or fall together.
Biological development involves both ontogenetic and phylogenetic
considerations. Thus, the development of specific traits, such as the
opposable thumb in humans, can be viewed both from the point of view of
the development of that trait in individual organisms (ontogeny) and
the development of that trait in the human lineage (phylogeny). The
development of knowledge and knowing mechanisms exhibits a parallel
distinction. We can consider the growth of an individual's corpus of
knowledge and epistemological norms or his or her brain (ontogeny) or
the growth of human knowledge and establishment of epistemological
norms across generations or the development of brains in the human
lineage (phylogeny). The EEM/EET distinction cuts across this
distinction since we may be concerned either with the ontogenetic or
phylogenetic development of, e. g., the brain or the ontogenetic or
phylogenetic development of norms and knowledge corpora. One might
expect that since current orthodoxy maintains that biological processes
of ontogenesis proceed differently from the selectionist processes of
phylogenesis, evolutionary epistemologies would reflect this
difference. Curiously enough, however, for the most part they do not.
For example, the theory of "neural Darwinism" as put forth by Edelman
(1987) and Changeaux (1985) offers a selectionist account of the
ontogenetic development of the neural structures of the brain. Karl
Popper's conjectures and refutations model of the development of human
knowledge is a well known example of a selectionist account which has
been applied both to the ontogenetic growth of knowledge in individuals
as well as the trans-generational (phylogenetic) evolution of
scientific knowledge. B. F. Skinner's theory of operant conditioning,
which deals with the ontogenesis of individual behavior, is explicitly
based upon the Darwinian selectionist model. (Skinner 1981)
A third distinction concerns descriptive versus prescriptive approaches
to epistemology and the growth of human knowledge. Traditionally,
epistemology has been construed as a normative project whose aim is to
clarify and defend conceptions of knowledge, foundations, evidential
warrant and justification. Many have argued that neither the EEM
programs nor the EET programs have anything at all to do with
epistemology properly (i. e., traditionally) understood. The basis for
this contention is that epistemology, properly understood, is a
normative discipline, whereas the EEM and EET programs are concerned
with the construction of causal and genetic (i.e., descriptive) models
of the evolution of cognitive capacities or knowledge systems. No such
models, it is alleged, can have anything important to contribute to
normative epistemology (e.g., Kim 1988). The force of this complaint
depends upon how one construes the relationship between evolutionary
epistemology and the tradition.
There are three possible configurations of the relationship between
descriptive and traditional epistemologies. (1) Descriptive
epistemologies can be construed as competitors to traditional normative
epistemologies. On this view, both are trying to address the same
concerns and offering competing solutions. Riedl (1984) defends this
position. A standard objection to such approaches is that descriptive
accounts are not adequate to do justice to the prescriptive elements of
normative methodologies. The extent to which an evolutionary approach
contributes to the resolution of traditional epistemological and
philosophical problems is a function of which approach one adopts (cf.
Dretske 1971, Bradie 1986, Ruse 1986, Radnitsky and Bartley 1987, Kim
1988). (2) Descriptive epistemology might be seen as a successor
discipline to traditional epistemology. On this reading, descriptive
epistemology does not address the questions of traditional epistemology
because it deems them irrelevant or unanswerable or uninteresting. Many
defenders of naturalized epistemologies fall into this camp (e.g., Munz
1993). (3) Descriptive epistemology might be seen as complementary to
traditional epistemology. This appears to be Campbell's view. On this
analysis, the function of the evolutionary approach is to provide a
descriptive account of knowing mechanisms while leaving the
prescriptive aspects of epistemology to more traditional approaches. At
best, the evolutionary analyses serve to rule out normative approaches
which are either implausible or inconsistent with an evolutionary
origin of human understanding.
EEM programs are saddled with the typical uncertainties of phylogenetic
reconstructions. Is this or that organ or structure an adaptation and
if so, for what? In addition, there are the uncertainties which result
from the necessarily sparse fossil record of brain and sensory organ
development. The EET programs are even more problematic. While it is
plausible enough to think that the evolutionary imprint on our organs
of thought influences what and how we do think, it is not at all clear
that the influence is direct, significant or detectible. Selectionist
epistemologies which endorse a "trial and error" methodology as an
appropriate model for understanding scientific change are not analytic
consequences of accepting that the brain and other ancillary organs are
adaptations which have evolved primarily under the influence of natural
selection. The viability of such selectionist models is an empirical
question which rests on the development of adequate models. Hull's
(1988) is, as he himself admits, but the first step in that direction.
Cziko (1995) is a manifesto urging the development of such models (cf.
also the evolutionary game theory modeling approach of Harms 1997).
Much hard empirical work needs to be done to sustain this line of
research. Non-selectionist evolutionary epistemologies, along the lines
of Ruse (1986), face a different range of difficulties. It remains to
be shown that any biological considerations are sufficiently
restrictive to narrow down the range of potential methodologies in any
meaningful way.
Nevertheless, the emergence in the latter quarter of the twentieth
century of serious efforts to provide an evolutionary account of human
understanding has potentially radical consequences. The application of
selectionist models to the development of human knowledge, for example,
creates an immediate tension. Standard traditional accounts of the
emergence and growth of scientific knowledge see science as a
progressive enterprise which, under the appropriate conditions of
rational and free inquiry, generates a body of knowledge which
progressively converges on the truth. Selectionist models of biological
evolution, on the other hand, are generally construed to be
non-progressive or, at most, locally so. Rather than generating
convergence, biological evolution produces diversity. Popper's
evolutionary epistemology attempts to embrace both but does so
uneasily. Kuhn's "scientific revolutions" account draws tentatively
upon a Darwinian model, but when criticized, Kuhn retreated. (cf Kuhn
1972, pp 172f with Lakatos and Musgrave 1970, p. 264) Toulmin (1972) is
a noteworthy exception. On his account, concepts of rationality are
purely "local" and are themselves subject to evolution. This, in turn,
seems to entail the need to abandon any sense of "goal directedness" in
scientific inquiry. This is a radical consequence which few have
embraced. Pursuing an evolutionary approach to epistemology raises
fundamental questions about the concepts of knowledge, truth, realism,
justification and rationality.
The interested reader should consult the extensive bibliography
originally developed by Donald Campbell and maintained by Gary Cziko
at
<http://faculty.ed.uiuc.edu/g-cziko/stb/>.
The KLI Theory Lab of the Konrad Lorenz Institute in Vienna offers
an extensive bio- and bibliographical data base covering eighteen
research areas related to evolution and cognition research. The entry
for “evolutionary epistemology” contains links to authors and
texts as well as a brief introduction and overview of the field. It is
an interactive database and the Institute encourages authors to submit
their own relevant bibliographies for inclusion in the database. The
database can be accessed at
<http://www.kli.ac.at
>.
Every scientific enterprise requires formal and semi-formal models
which allow the quantitative characterization of its objects of study.
The attempt to transform the philosophical study of knowledge into a
scientific discipline which approaches knowledge as a biological
phenomenon is no different. Much of the evolutionary epistemology
literature has been concerned with how to conceive of knowledge as a
natural phenomenon, what difference this would make to our
understanding of our place in the world, and with answering objections
to the project. There are, as well, a number of more technical projects
which attempt to provide the theoretical tools necessary for a
naturalistic epistemology.
In the simplest sort of model, an organism has to deal with an
environment that has two states, S1 and
S2, and has two possible responses
R1 and R2. We suppose that what
the organism does in each state makes a difference to its fitness.
Fitnesses are usually written characterized by a matrix W.
The individual elements of the matrix Wij are
the fitness consequences of response i in state j.
So, for instance, W21 denotes the fitness
consequences of R2 in S1. If we
let W11 and W22 equal one and
W12 and W21 equal zero, then
there is a clear evolutionary advantage to performing
R1 in S1 and
R2 in S2.
However, the organism must first detect the state of the
environment, and detectors are not in general perfectly reliable. If
the organism responds automatically to the detector, we can use the
probabilities of responses given states to characterize the reliability
of the detector. We write the probability of R1
given S1 as
Pr(R1|S1). This allows us to
calculate that responding to the detector rather than always choosing
R1 or R2 will be advantageous
just in case the following inequality holds (cf. Godfrey-Smith
1996):
Pr(R2|S2) /(1
Pr(R1|S1)) >
Pr(S1)(W11
W21)/(1Pr(S1))(W22
W12)
This simple model demonstrates that whether or not flexible responses
are adaptive depends on the particular characteristics of the fitness
differences that the responses make, the probability of the various
states of the environment, and the reliability of the detector. The
particular result is calculated assuming that detecting the
environmental state and the flexible response system is free in
evolutionary terms. More complete analyses would include the costs of
these factors.
Static optimization models like the one outlined above can be
extended in several ways. Most obviously, the number of environmental
states and organismic responses can be increased, but there are other
modifications that are more interesting. Signal detection theory, for
instance, models the detectors and cues in more detail. In one example,
a species of "sea moss" detects the presence of predatory sea slugs via
a chemical cue. They respond by growing spines, which is costly. The
cue in this case, the water-borne chemical, comes in a variety of
concentrations, which indicate various levels of danger. Signal
detection theory allows us to calculate the best threshold value of the
detector for the growing of spines.
Static models depict evolutionary processes in terms of fitness
costs and benefits. They are static in the sense that they model no
actual process, but merely calculate the direction of change for
different situations. If fitness is high, a type will increase, if low
it will decrease. When fitnesses are equal, population proportions
remain at stable equilibrium. Dynamic models typically employ the kinds
of calculations involved in static models to depict actual change over
time in population proportions. Instead of calculating whether change
will occur and in what direction, dynamic models follow change.
Population dynamics, sometimes referred to as "replicator dynamics",
offers a tractable way to model the evolution of populations over time
under the kinds of selective pressures that can be characterized by
static optimization models. This is often necessary, since the dynamics
of such populations are often difficult to predict purely on the basis
of static considerations of payoff differences. The so-called
"replicator dynamics" were named by Taylor and Jonker (1978) and
generalized by Schuster and Sigmund (1983) and Hofbauer and Sigmund
(1988). They trace their source back to the seminal work of R.A. Fisher
in the 1920's and 30's. The generalization covers evolutionary models
used in population genetics, evolutionary game theory, ecology, and the
study of prebiotic evolution. The models can be implemented either
mathematically or computationally, and can model either stepwise
(discrete) or continuous evolutionary change.
Population dynamics models the evolution of populations. A
population is a collection of individuals, which are categorized
according to type. The types in genetics are genes, in evolutionary
game theory, strategies. The types of interest in epistemological
models would be types of cognitive apparatuses, or cognitive strategies
-- ways of responding to environmental cues, ways of manipulating
representations, and so forth. Roughly, EEM models focus on the
inherited and EET models focus on the learned. The evolution of the
population consists in changes of the relative frequency of the
different types within the population. Selection, typified by
differential reproductive success, is represented as follows. Each type
has a growth rate or "fitness", designated by w, and a
frequency designated by p. The frequency of type i at
the next generation pi
is simply the old frequency multiplied by the fitness
and divided by the mean fitness of the population
"
".
pi
= pi
wi /
Division by
has the effect of
"normalizing" the frequencies, so that they add up to one after each is
multiplied by its fitness. It also makes evident that the frequency of
a type will increase just in case its fitness is higher than the
current population average.
Fitness
Fitnesses, which should be understood simply as the aggregation of
probable-growth factors that drive the dynamics of large populations,
may depend on a variety of factors. Fitness components differ from
variation components in that they affect population frequencies
proportionally to those frequencies, that is to say, multiplicatively.
Fitness component in biological evolution include mortality and
reproductive rate. In cultural evolution, they include transmission
probability and rejection probability. Within either sort of model,
what matters is how fitnesses change as a result of other changing
factors within the model. In the simplest cases, fitnesses are fixed
and the type with the highest fitness inevitably dominates the
population. In more complex cases, fitnesses may depend on variable
factors like who one plays against, or the state of a variable
environment. Most commonly, variable fitnesses are calculated using a
payoff matrix like the one above. In general, to calculate the expected
fitness of a type, one multiplies the fitness a type would have in each
situation times the likelihood that individuals in the population will
confront that situation and adds the resulting products.
wi =
SA Pr(A)WiA
where WiA is type i's fitness in situation
A. This sort of calculation assumes that the effects of the
various situations are additive. More complex situations can be
modeled, of course, but additive matrices are the standard. It should
be noted, however, that matrix-driven evolution can exhibit quite
complex behavior. For instance, chaotic behavior is possible with as
few as four strategies (Skyrms 1992).
Some relationships may be represented without a matrix. Boyd and
Richerson (1985), for instance, were interested in a special kind of
frequency dependent transmission bias in culture, where being common
conferred an advantage due to imitators "doing as the Romans do." In
such a case, the operative fitness of the type is just the fitness as
calculated according to the usual factors, and then modified as a
function of the frequency of the type.
Continuity and Computation
The conceptual bases of replicator dynamics are quite straightforward.
Getting results typically requires one of two approaches. In order to
prove more than rudimentary mathematical results, one typically needs
to derive a continuous version of the dynamics. The basic form is
dpi/dt =
p(wi
)
with fitnesses calculated as usual. Mathematical approaches have been
quite productive, though the bulk of theoretical results apply
primarily to population genetics. See Hofbauer and Sigmund (1988) for a
compendium of such results, as well as a reasonable graduate-level
introduction to the mathematical study of evolutionary processes.
The second approach is computational. With the increase in power of
personal computers, computational implementation of evolutionary models
become increasingly attractive. They require only rudimentary
programming skills, and are in general much more flexible in the
assumptions they require. The general strategy is to create an array to
hold population frequencies and fitnesses, and then a series of
procedures (or methods or functions) which
- calculate fitnesses,
- update frequencies with the new fitnesses, and
- manage interface details like outputting the new state of the
population to a file or the screen.
A loop then runs the routines in sequence, over and over again. Most
modelers are happy to put their source code on the internet, which is
probably the best place to find it.
Modeling Cultural Evolution
Part of the difficulty in understanding cognitive behavior as the
product of evolution is that there are at least three very different
evolutionary processes involved. First, there is the biological
evolution of cognitive and perceptual mechanisms via genetic
inheritance. Second, there is the cultural evolution of languages and
concepts. Third, there is the trial-and-error learning process that
occurs during an individual's lifetime. Moreover, there is some reason
to agree with Donald T. Campbell that understanding human knowledge
fully will require understanding the interaction between these
processes. This requires that we be able to model both processes of
biological and cultural evolution. There are by now a number of
well-established models of biological evolution. Cultural evolution
presents more novelty.
Perhaps the most popular attempt to understand cultural evolution is
Richard Dawkins' (1976) invention of the "meme." Dawkins observed that
what lies at the heart of biological evolution is differential
reproduction. Evolution in general was then the competitive dynamics of
lineages of self-replicating entities. If culture was to evolve, on
this view, there had to be cultural "replicators", or entities whose
differential replication in culture constituted the cultural
evolutionary process. Dawkins dubbed these entities "memes", and they
were characterized as informational entities which infect our brains,
"leaping from head to head" via what we ordinarily call imitation.
Common examples include infectious tunes, and religious ideologies. The
main difficulty with this approach has been with providing
specifications for the basic entities. The identity conditions of genes
can be given, in theory, in terms of sequences of base pairs in
chromosomes. There appears to be no such fundamental "alphabet" for the
items of cultural transmission. Consequently, the project of "memetics"
as contending basis for evolutionary epistemology is on hold pending an
adequate understanding of its basic ontology. [See the online
Journal of Memetics
for more information.]
Population models have been used to good effect in modeling cultural
transmission processes. Evolutionary game theory models are frequently
claimed to cover both processes in which strategies are inherited and
those in which they are imitated. This application is possible in the
absence of any specification of the underlying nature of strategies,
for instance, whether they are to be thought of as "things" which are
replicated, or whether they are properties or states of the individuals
whose strategies they are. This is sometimes referred to as the
"epidemiological approach", though again, the comparison to infection
is due to the quantitative tools used in analysis rather than to any
presupposition regarding the underlying ontology of cultural
transmission.
The kind of levels involved in evolutionary epistemology are quite
different than the kind of levels of selection which are discussed much
more often in the "levels of selection" debate in evolutionary biology.
In evolutionary biology, the "levels" of selection under discussion are
levels of scale. The debate concerns whether genes are always the
"units" or "targets" of selection, or whether selection can occur on
higher levels, like organisms, groups, and species. The levels involved
in evolutionary epistemology, on the other hand, are levels of the
regulatory hierarchy involved in the control of behavior. These include
the genetic bases of cognitive and perceptual hardware, concepts,
languages, techniques, beliefs, preferences, and so forth. Note that in
the case of evolutionary epistemology, the terms "levels" and
"hierarchy" may be impressionistic. There is often no clear arrangement
of levels at all.
There are at least two different approaches that have been taken to
modeling multi-level evolution.
- Dual Transmission Models: Boyd and Richerson (1985) adapted models
from genetics to model a case in which a trait (cooperation) was
affected both by genetic and cultural evolution. It was first shown
that a genetically determined bias on cultural transmission could be
selected for in a migratory population. The bias made it easier to pick
up local customs, increasing the likelihood of imitation beyond that
determined by the frequency and perceived value of the behavior. Once
this bias was in place, its effect was strong enough to overcome the
perceived costs involved in cooperative behavior. The model yielded two
important results. First, it provided a novel mechanism according to
which cooperative behavior can stabilize in migratory populations. But
more importantly, it demonstrated that cultural evolution cannot be
predicted purely on the basis of genetic fitnesses.
- Multiple Population Models: Harms (1997) constructed a multi-level
dynamic population model of bumblebee learning. Mutual information
between distributions of sensor types, overt foraging behaviors, and
internal foraging preferences on the one hand and environmental states
on the other was assessed and compared to average fitness of the
population states. It was shown that information present in overt
behaviors may be underutilized, and that exaptation of sensor
mechanisms for preference formation can bring about the utilization of
that information.
Full descriptive accounts of truth and justification both demand a
theory of meaning. Until a sign has meaning, it cannot be true or
false. Moreover, determining the meaning of justificatory claims may
provide a descriptive theory of justification. Presumably, what makes a
claim of justification true is the basis of that justification. If
meaning is conventional, then the evolution of meaning becomes an
instance of the evolution of conventions.
Models of the evolution of conventions have in one case been
extended to apply to meaning conventions. Skyrms (1996, chapter 5) gave
an evolutionary interpretation of David Lewis' (1969) model of
rational selection of meaning conventions. Skyrms was able to show that
there is strong selection on the formation of "signaling systems" in
mixed populations with a full set of coordinated, countercoordinated,
and uncoordinated strategies. It is significant that the structure of
the model and the selective process by which meaning conventions emerge
and are stabilized largely parallels the account of the evolution of
meaning given by Ruth Millikan (1984).
In the simplest version, the model is constructed as follows: We
imagine that there are two states of affairs T, two acts
A, and two signals M. Players have an equal chance of
being in either the position of sender, or receiver. Receivers must
decide what to do based purely on what the sender tells them. In this
purely cooperative version, each player gets one point if the receiver
does A1 if the state is T1 or
A2 if the state is T2.
Since players will be both sender and receiver, they must have a
strategy for each situation. There are sixteen such strategies, and we
suppose them to be either inherited (or learned) from biological
parents, or imitated on the basis of perceived success in terms of
points earned. Strategies I1 and
I2 are signaling systems, in that if both players
play the same one of these two strategies they will always get their
payoff. I3 and I4 are
anti-signaling strategies, which result in consistent miscoordination,
though they do well against each other. All of the other strategies
involve S3, S4,
R3, or R4, which results in the
same act being performed no matter what the external state is.
Sender Strategies:
| S1: |
Send M1 if T1;
M2 if T2 |
| S2: |
Send M2 if
T1;M1 if
T2 |
| S3: |
Send M1 if T1 or
T2 |
| S4: |
Send M2 if T1 or
T2
|
Receiver Strategies:
| R1: |
Do A1 if M1;
A2 if M2 |
| R2: |
Do A2 if M1;
A1 if M2 |
| R3: |
Do A1 for M1 or
M2 |
| R4: |
Do A2 for M1 or
M2
|
Complete Strategies:
| I1: |
S1,R1 |
| I2: |
S2,R2, |
| I3: |
S1,R2 |
| I4: |
S2,R2 |
| I5: |
S1,R3 |
| I6: |
S2,R3 |
| I7: |
S1,R4 |
| I8: |
S2,R4 |
| I9: |
S3,R1 |
| I10: |
S3,R2 |
| I11: |
S3,R3 |
| I12: |
S3,R4 |
| I13: |
S4,R1 |
| I14: |
S4,R2 |
| I15: |
S4,R3 |
| I16: |
S4,R4
|
Simulation results showed that virtually all initial population
distributions become dominated by one or the other of the two signaling
system strategies. The situation becomes more complex when more
realistic payoffs are introduced, for instance, that the sender incurs
a cost rather than automatically sharing the benefit that the receiver
gets from correct behavior for the environment. Even in such
situations, however, the most likely course of evolution is domination
by a signaling system.
- Bradie, Michael(1986), "Assessing Evolutionary Epistemology," in
Biology & Philosophy 1, 401-459.
- Bradie, Michael(1994), "Epistemology from an Evolutionary Point of
View." In Conceptual Issues in Evolutionary Biology, edited by
Elliott Sober, 453- 475. Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
- Bradie, Michael. (1989), "Evolutionary Epistemology as Naturalized
Epistemology." In Issues in Evolutionary Epistemology, edited
by K. Hahlweg and C. A. Hooker, 393-412. Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
- Boyd, Robert, and Peter J. Richerson (1985), Culture and the
Evolutionary Process, Chicago: The University of Chicago Press,
299 pp.
- Callebaut, Werner, and Rik Pinxten (eds.).(1987, Evolutionary
Epistemology: A Multiparadigm Program With a Complete Evolutionary
Epistemology Bibliography, (Synthese Library, 190), Dordrecht:
Reidel.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1956a), "Adaptive Behavior from Random
Response." Behavioral Science 1, no. 2: 105-110.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1956b), "Perception as Substitute Trial and
Error." Psychological Review 63, no. 5: 331- 342.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1959), "Methodological Suggestions from a
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- Selection Theory Bibliography,
maintained by Gary
Cziko (Educational Psychology, University of Illinois)
- Evolving Artificial Moral Ecologies,
Centre for Applied Ethics, University of British Columbia
- The Journal of Memetics,
sponsored by the Centre for Policy
Modeling (Manchester Metropolitan University), the Principia
Cybernetica Project, and Systems Engineering, Policy Analysis and
Management (Delft University of Technology)
- KLI Theory Lab,
sponsored by the Konrad Lorenz Institute, Vienna
epistemology: naturalized |
game theory: evolutionary |
information |
teleology: teleological notions in biology
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