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Supertasks
Supertasks have posed problems for philosophy since the time of Zeno of
Elea. The term ‘supertask’ is new but it designates an idea
already present in the formulation of the old motion paradoxes of Zeno,
namely the idea of an infinite number of actions performed in a finite
amount of time. The main problem lies in deciding what follows from the
performance of a supertask. Some philosophers have claimed that what
follows is a contradiction and that supertasks are, therefore,
logically impossible. Others have denied this conclusion, and hold that
the study of supertasks can help us improve our understanding of the
physical world, or even our theories about it.
A supertask may be defined as an infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. The terms
‘action’ and ‘operation’ must not be understood
in their usual sense, which involves a human agent. Human agency may be
involved but it is not necessary. To show this, let us see how actions
can be characterised precisely without any references to man. We will
assume that at each instant of time the state of the world relevant to
a specific action can be described by a set S of sentences. Now an
action or operation applied to a state of the world results in a change
in that state, that is, in the set S corresponding to it. Consequently,
an arbitrary action a will be defined (Allis and Koetsier [1995]) as a
change in the state of the world by which the latter changes from state
S before the change to state a(S) after it. This means that an action
has a beginning and an end, but does not entail that there is a finite
lapse of time between them. For instance, take the case of a lamp that
is on at t = 0 and remains so until t = 1, an instant at which it
suddenly goes off. Before t =1 the state of the lamp (which is the only
relevant portion of the world here) can be described by the sentence
‘lamp on’, and after t =1 by the sentence ‘lamp
off’, without there being a finite lapse of time between the
beginning and the end of the action. Some authors have objected to this
consequence of the definition of action, and they might be right if we
were dealing with the general philosophical problem of change. But we
need not be concerned with those objections at this stage, since in the
greatest majority of the relevant supertasks instantaneous actions
(i.e. actions without any duration) can be replaced by actions lasting
a finite amount of time without affecting the analysis at any
fundamental point.
There is a particular type of supertask called hypertasks.
A hypertask is a non-numerable infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. Therefore, a
supertask which is not a hypertask will be a numerable infinite
sequence of actions or operations carried out in a finite interval of
time. Finally, a task can be defined as a finite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time.
To gain a better insight into the fundamental nature of the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks, consider the distinction
between tasks in general (finite sequences of actions of the type
(a1, a2, a3, … ,
an)) and one particular type of supertasks, namely those
consisting of an infinite sequence of actions of the type
(a1, a2, a3, … , an,
… ) and thus having the same type of order as the natural order
of positive integers: 1, 2, 3, … , n, … (it is customary
to denote this type of order with letter ‘w’ and
so the related supertasks can be called supertasks of type w).
In the case of a task T = (a1, a2,
a3, … , an) it is natural to say that T is
applicable in state S if:
a1 is applicable to S,
a2 is applicable to a1(S),
a3 is applicable to a2(a1(S)),
… , and,
an is applicable to
an-1(an-2(…
(a2(a1(S)))… )).
The successive states of the world relevant to task T can be defined by
means of the finite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, a1(S), a2(a1(S)),
a3(a2(a1(S))), …,
an(an-1(an-2 (…
(a2(a1(S)))…))),
whose last term will therefore describe the relevant state of the world
after the performance of T. Or, equivalently, the state resulting from
applying T to S will be T(S) =
an(an-1(an-2 (…
(a2(a1(S)))… ))).
Now take the case of a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, …, an, …). Let us give the name
Tn to the task which consists in performing the first n
actions of T. That is, Tn = (a1, a2,
a3, …, an). Now it is natural to say that
T is applicable in state S if Tn is applicable in S for each
natural number n, and, obviously,
Tn(S) =
an(an-1(an-2
(…(a2(a1(S)))…))).
The successive states of the world relevant to supertask T can be
described by means of the infinite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, T1(S), T2(S), …,
Tn(S), …
A difficulty arises, however, when we want to specify the set of
sentences which describe the relevant state of the world after the
performance of supertask T, because the infinite sequence above lacks a
final term. Put equivalently, it is difficult to specify the relevant
state of the world resulting from the application of supertask T to S
because there seems to be no final state resulting from such an
application. This inherent difficulty is increased by the fact that, by
definition, supertask T is performed in a finite time, and so there
must exist one first instant of time t* at which it can be said that
the performance happened. Now notice that the world must naturally be
in a certain specific state at t*, which is the state resulting from
the application of T, but that, nevertheless, we have serious trouble
to specify this state, as we have just seen.
Since we have defined supertasks in terms of actions and actions in
terms of changes in the state of the world, there is a basic
indeterminacy regarding what type of processes taking place in time
should be considered supertasks, which is linked to the basic
indeterminacy that there is regarding which type of sets of sentences
are to be allowed in descriptions of the state of the world and which
are not. For this reason, there are some processes that would be
regarded as supertasks by virtually every philosopher and some about
which opinions differ. For an instance of the first sort of process,
take the one known as ‘Thomson's lamp’. Thomson's lamp is
basically a device consisting of a lamp and a switch set on an
electrical circuit. The switch can be in one of just two positions and
the lamp has got to be lit — when the switch is in position
‘on’ — or else dim — when the switch is in
position ‘off’. Assume that initially (at t = 12 A.M., say)
the lamp is dim and that it is thenceforth subject to the following
infinite sequence of actions: when half of the time remaining until t*
= 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out the action a1 of turning
the switch into position ‘on’ and, as a result, the lamp is
lit (a1 is thus performed at t = 1/2 P.M.); when half the
time between the performance of a1 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone
by, we carry out action a2 of turning to the switch into
position ‘off’ and, as a result, the lamp is dim
(a2 is thus performed at t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when half the
time between the performance of a2 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone
by, we carry out the action of turning the switch into position
‘on’ and, as a result, the lamp is lit (a3 is
thus performed at t = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8), and so on. When we get to
instant t* = 1 P.M. we will have carried out an infinite sequence of
actions, that is, a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, … , an, … ). If, for the sake
of simplicity, we are only concerned about the evolution of the lamp
(not the switch) the state of the world relevant to the description of
our supertask admits of only two descriptions, one through the unitary
set of sentences {lamp lit} and the other through the set {lamp dim}.
As an instance of the second sort of processes we referred to above,
those about which no consensus has been reached as to whether they are
supertasks, we can take the process which is described in one of the
forms of Zeno's dichotomy paradox. Suppose that initially (at t = 12
A.M., say) Achilles is at point A (x = 0) and moving in a
straight line, with a constant velocity v = 1 km/h, towards
point B (x = 1), which is 1 km. away from A. Assume, in
addition, that Achilles does not modify his velocity at any point. In
that case, we can view Achilles's run as the performance of a
supertask, in the following way: when half the time until t* = 1 P.M.
has gone by, Achilles will have carried out the action a1 of
going from point x = 0 to point x = 1/2
(a1 is thus performed in the interval of time between t =12
A.M. and t = 1/2 P.M.), when half the time from the end of the
performance of a1 until t* = 1 P.M. will have elapsed,
Achilles will have carried out the action a2 of going from
point x = 1/2 to point x = 1/2 + 1/4 (a2
is thus performed in the interval of time between t = 1/2 P.M. and t =
1/2 + 1/4 P.M.), when half the time from the end of the performance of
a2 until t* = 1 P.M. will have elapsed, Achilles will have
carried out the action a3 of going from point x =
1/2 + 1/4 to point x = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 (a3 is thus
performed in the interval of time between t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M. and t =
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so on. When we get to instant t* = 1 P.M.,
Achilles will have carried out an infinite sequence of actions, that
is, a supertask T = (a1, a2, a3,
… , an, … ), provided we allow the state of
the world relevant for the description of T to be specified, at any
arbitrary instant, by a single sentence: the one which specifies
Achilles's position at that instant. Several philosophers have objected
to this conclusion, arguing that, in contrast to Thomson's lamp,
Achilles's run does not involve an infinity of actions (acts) but of
pseudo-acts. In their view, the analysis presented above for Achilles's
run is nothing but the breakdown of one process into a numerable
infinity of subprocesses, which does not make it into a supertask. In
Allis and Koetsier's words, such philosophers believe that a set of
position sentences is not always to be admitted as a description of the
state of the world relevant to a certain action. In their opinion, a
relevant description of a state of the world should normally include a
different type of sentences (as is the case with Thomson's lamp) or, in
any case, more than simply position sentences.
In section 1.2 I have pointed out and illustrated the fundamental
philosophical problem posed by supertasks. Obviously, one will only
consider it a problem if one deems the concepts employed in its
formulation acceptable. In fact, some philosophers reject them, because
they regard the very notion of supertask as problematic, as leading to
contradictions or at least to insurmountable conceptual difficulties.
Among these philosophers the first well-known one is Zeno of Elea.
Consider the dichotomy paradox in the formulation of it given in
section 1.3. According to Zeno, Achilles would never get to point B
(x = 1) because he would first have to reach the mid point of
his run (x = 1/2), after that he would have to get to the mid
point of the span which he has left (x = 1/2 + 1/4), and then
to the mid point of the span which is left (x = 1/2 + 1/4 +
1/8), and so on. Whatever the mid point Achilles may reach in his
journey, there will always exist another one (the mid point of the
stretch that is left for him to cover) that he has not reached yet. In
other words, Achilles will never be able to reach point B and finish
his run. According to Owen (Owen [1957-58]), in this as well as in his
other paradoxes, Zeno was concerned to show that the Universe is a
simple, global entity which is not comprised of different parts. He
tried to demonstrate that if we take to making divisions and
subdivisions we will obtain absurd results (as in the dichotomy case)
and that we must not yield to the temptation of breaking up the world.
Now the notion of supertask entails precisely that, division into
parts, as it involves breaking up a time interval into successive
intervals. Therefore, supertasks are not feasible in the Zenonian world
and, since they lead to absurd results, the notion of supertask itself
is conceptually objectionable.
In stark contrast to Zeno, the dichotomy paradox is standardly
solved by saying that the successive distances covered by Achilles as
he progressively reaches the mid points of the spans he has left to go
through — 1/2, 1/4, 1/8, 1/16, … — form an infinite
series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + … whose sum is 1. Consequently,
Achilles will indeed reach point B (x = 1) at t* = 1 P.M.
(which is to be expected if he travels with velocity v = 1
km/h, as has been assumed). Then there is no problem whatsoever in
splitting up his run into smaller sub-runs and, so, no inherent problem
about the notion of supertask. An objection can be made, however, to
this standard solution to the paradox: it tells us where Achilles is at
each instant but it does not explain where Zeno's argument breaks down.
Importantly, there is another objection to the standard solution, which
hinges on the fact that, when it is claimed that the infinite series
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + … adds up to 1, this is substantiated
by the assertion that the sequence of partial sums 1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2
+ 1/4 + 1/8, … has limit 1, that is, that the difference between
the successive terms of the sequence and number 1 becomes progressively
smaller than any positive integer, no matter how small. But it might be
countered that this is just a patch up: the infinite series 1/2 + 1/4 +
1/8 + … seems to involve infinite sums and thus the performance
of a supertask, and the proponent of the standard solution is in fact
presupposing that supertasks are feasible just in order to justifiy
that they are. To this the latter might reply that the assertion that
the sum of the series is 1 presupposes no infinite sum, since, by
definition, the sum of a series is the limit to which its partial (and
so finite) sums approach. His opponent can now express his disagreement
with the response that the one who supports the standard solution is
deducing a matter of fact (that Achilles is at x = 1 at t* = 1
P.M.) from a definition pertaining to the arithmetic of infinite
series, and that it is blatantly unacceptable to deduce empirical
propositions from mere definitions.
Before concluding our discussion of the arguments connected with Zeno's
dichotomy paradox which have been put forward against the conceptual
feasibility of supertasks, we should deal with the so-called inverse
dichotomy of Zeno, which can also be formulated as a supertask, but
whose status as a logical possibility seems to some philosophers to be
even more doubtful than that of the direct version expounded in section
2.1. The process involved in the paradox of inverse dichotomy admits of
a supertask kind of description, as follows. Suppose that at t = 12
A.M. Achilles is at point A (x = 0) and wishes to do the
action of reaching point B (x = 1). In order to do this action
he must first of all go from point A to the mid point b1
(x = 1/2) of the span AB that he wishes to cover. In order to
do this, he must in turn first do the action of going from point A to
the mid point b2 (x = 1/4) of the span
Ab1 that he wishes to cover, and so on . In order to reach
B, Achilles will have to accomplish an infinite sequence of actions,
that is, a supertask T* = (… , an, … ,
a3, a2, a1), provided we allow the
state of the world relevant to the description of T* to be specified,
at a given arbitrary instant, by a single sentence, the one specifying
Achilles's position at that instant. Notice in the first place that T*
has the same type of order as the natural order of negative integers:
… , -n, … , -3, -2, -1 (such order type is usually
denoted with the expression ‘w*’ and the related
supertasks can therefore be called supertasks of type w*). The
philosophical problem connected with supertasks of type w,
already discussed in section 1.2 above, does not arise now because the
set of sentences which describes the relevant state of the world after
the performance of supertask T* is obviously a1(S), with S
the set of sentences describing the initial relevant state of the
world. But as the successive states of the world after S in relation to
T* can be described by means of the infinite sequence of sets of
sentences … , an(S), … , a3(S),
a2(S), a1(S), some philosophers think it puzzling
and unacceptable that the initial set of sentences in that sequence
cannot be specified. This really means that we cannot specify which is
the action in supertask T* that should be carried out first and that we
consequently ignore how to begin. Isn't that proof enough that
supertasks of type w* are impossible? Chihara (1965), for
example, says that Zeno's inverse dichotomy is even more problematic
than the direct one, since Achilles is supposed to be capable of doing
something akin to counting the natural numbers in reverse order. In his
opinion, it is just as impossible for Achilles to start his run —
if viewed as a supertask of type w* — as it is to start
this reverse counting process.
Thomson (1954-55) was convinced that he could show supertasks to be
logically impossible. To this end, he made up the lamp example analysed
in section 1.3, since known as ‘Thomson's lamp’. Thomson
argued that the analysis of the workings of his lamp leads to
contradiction, and therefore the supertask involved is logically
impossible. But then, to the extent that this supertask is
representative of ‘genuine’ supertasks, all genuine
supertasks are impossible. Thomson's argument is simple. Let us ask
ourselves what the state of the lamp is at t* = 1 P.M. At that instant
the lamp cannot be lit, the reason being the way we manipulate it: we
never light the lamp without dimming it some time later. Nor can the
lamp be dim, because even if it is dim initially, we light it and
subsequently never dim it without lighting it back again some time
later. Therefore,at t* = 1 P.M. the lamp can be neither dim nor lit.
However, one of its functioning conditions is that it must be either
dim or lit. Thus, a contradiction arises. Conclusion: Thomson's lamp
or, better, the supertask consisting in its functioning is logically
impossible. Now is Thomson's argument correct? Benacerraf (1962)
detected a serious flaw in it. Let us in principle distinguish between
the series of instants of time in which the actions ai of
the supertask are performed (which will be called the t-series) and the
instant t* = 1 P.M., the first instant after the supertask has been
accomplished. Thomson's argument hinges on the way we act on the lamp,
but we only act on it at instants in the t-series, and so what can be
deduced logically from this way of acting will apply only to instants
in the t-series. As t* = 1 P.M. does not belong to the t-series, it
follows that Thomson's supposed conclusion that the lamp cannot be lit
at t* is fallacious, and so is his conclusion that it cannot be dim at
t*. The conditions obtaining in the lamp problem only enable us to
conclude that the lamp will be either dim or else lit but not both at
t* = 1 P.M., and this follows from the fact that this exclusive
disjunction was presupposed from the start to be true at each and every
instant of time, independently of the way in which we could act on the
lamp in the t-series of instants of time. What cannot be safely
inferred is which one of these two states -dim or lit- the lamp will be
in at t* = 1 P.M. or, alternatively, the state of the lamp at t* = 1
P.M. is not logically determined by what has happened before that
instant. This consequence tallies with what was observed in section 2.1
about the fallacy committed by adherents to the standard solution
against Zeno: they seek to deduce that at instant t* = 1 P.M. Achilles
will be at point B from an analysis of the sub-runs performed by him
before that instant, that is, they assume that Achilles's state at t*
follows logically from his states at instants previous to t*, and in so
assuming they make the same mistake as Thomson.
Thomson (1954-55) put forward one more argument against the logical
possibility of his lamp. Let us assign to the lamp the value 0 when it
is dim and the value 1 when it is lit. Then lighting the lamp means
adding one unity (going from 0 to 1) and dimming it means subtracting
one unity (going from 1 to 0). It thus seems that the final state of
the lamp at t* = 1 P.M., after an infinite, and alternating, sequence
of lightings (additions of one unity) and dimmings (subtractions of one
unity), should be described by the infinite series 1-1+1-1+1… If
we accept the conventional mathematical definition of the sum of a
series, this series has no sum, because the partial sums 1, 1-1, 1-1+1,
1-1+1-1, … , etc. take on the values 1 and 0 alternatively,
without ever approaching a definite limit that could be taken to be the
proper sum of the series. But in that case it seems that the final
state of the lamp can neither be dim (0) nor lit (1), which contradicts
our assumption that the lamp is at all times either dim or lit.
Benacerraf's (1962) reply was that even though the first, second,
third, … , n-th partial sum of the series 1-1+1-1+1… does
yield the state of the lamp after one, two, three, … , n actions
ai (of lighting or dimming), it does not follow from this
that the final state of the lamp after the infinite sequence of actions
ai must of necessity be given by the sum of the series, that
is, by the limit to which its partial sums progressively approach. The
reason is that a property shared by the partial sums of a series does
not have to be shared by the limit to which those partial sums tend.
For instance, the partial sums of the series 0.3 + 0.03 + 0.003 +
0.0003 + … are 0.3, 0.3 + 0.03 = 0.33, 0.3 + 0.03 + 0.003 =
0.333,… , all of them, clearly, numbers less than 1/3; however,
the limit to which those partial sums tend (that is, the sum of the
original series) is 0.3333… , which is precisely the number
1/3.
Another one of the classical arguments against the logical possibility
of supertasks comes from Black (1950-51) and is constructed around the
functioning of an infinity machine of his own invention. An infinity
machine is a machine that can carry out an infinite number of actions
in a finite time. Black's aim is to show that an infinity machine is a
logical impossibility. Consider the case of one such machine whose sole
task is to carry a ball from point A (x = 0) to point B
(x = 1) and viceversa. Assume, in addition, that initially (at
t = 12 A.M., say) the ball is at A and that the machine carries out the
following infinite sequence of operations: when half the time until t*
= 1 P.M. has gone by, it does the action a1 of taking the
ball from position A to position B (a1 is thus carried out
at t = 1/2 P.M.); when half the time between the performance of
a1 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, it does the action
a2 of taking the ball from position B to position A
(a2 is thus carried out at t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when half
the time between the performance of a2 and t* = 1 P.M. has
gone by, the machine does the action a3 of taking the ball
from position A to position B (a3 is thus performed in t =
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so on. When we get to instant t* = 1 P.M.
the machine will have carried out an infinite sequence of actions, that
is, a supertask T = (a1, a2, a3,
… , an, … ). The parallelism with Thomson's
lamp is clear when it is realised that the ball in position A
corresponds to the dim lamp and the ball in position B corresponds to
the lit lamp. Nevertheless, Black believes that by assuming that at
each instant the ball is either in A or else in B (and note that
assuming this means that the machine transports the ball from A to B
and viceversa instantaneously, but we need not be worried by this,
since all that we are concerned with now is logical or conceptual
possibility, not physical possibility), he can deduce, by a totally
different route from Thomson's based on the symmetrical functioning of
his machine, a contradiction regarding its state at t* = 1 P.M..
However, Benacerraf's criticisms also applies to Black's argument. In
effect, the latter hinges on how the machine works, and as this has
only been specified for instants of time previous to t* = 1 P.M., it
follows that what can be logically inferred from the functioning of the
machine is only applicable to those instants previous to t* = 1 P.M..
Black seeks to deduce a contradiction at t* = 1 P.M. but he fails at
the same point as Thomson: whatever happens to the ball at t* = 1 P.M.
cannot be a logical consequence of what has happened to it before. Of
course, one can always specify the functioning of the machine for
instants t greater than or equal to 1 P.M. by saying that at all those
instants the machine will not perform any actions at all, but that is
not going to help Black. His argument is fallacious because he seeks to
reach a logical conclusion regarding instant t* = 1 P.M. from
information relative to times previous to that instant.. In the
standard argument against Zeno's dichotomy one could similarly specify
Achilles's position at t* = 1 P.M. saying, for instance, that he is at
B (x = 1), but there is no way that this is going to get us a
valid argument out of a fallacious one, which seeks to deduce logically
where Achilles will be at t* = 1 P.M. from information previous to that
instant of time.
The cases dealt with above are examples of how Benacerraf's strategy
can be used against supposed demonstrations of the logical
impossibility of supertasks. We have seen that the strategy is based on
the idea that
(I) the state of a system at an instant t* is not a logical
consequence of which states he has been in before t* (where by
‘state’ I mean ‘relevant state of the world’,
see section 1.1)
and occasionally on the idea that
(II) the properties shared by the partial sums of a series
do not have to be shared by the limit to which those partial sums
tend.
Since the partial sums of a series make up a succession (of partial
sums), (II) may be rewritten as follows:
(III) the properties shared by the terms of a succession do
not have to be shared by the limit to which that succession
tends.
If we keep (I), (II) and (III) well in mind, it is easy not to yield to
the perplexing implications of certain supertasks dealt with in the
literature. And if we do not yield to the perplexing results, we will
also not fall into the trap of considering supertasks conceptually
impossible. (III), for instance, may be used to show that it is not
impossible for Achilles to perform the supertasks of the inverse and
the direct dichotomy of Zeno. Take the case of the direct dichotomy:
the limit of the corresponding succession of instants of time
t1, t2, t3, … at which each one
of Achilles's successive sub-runs is finished can be the instant at
which Achilles's supertask has been accomplished, even if such a
supertask is not achieved at any one of the instants in the infinite
succession t1, t2, t3, … (all
of this in perfect agreement with (III)).
As a corollary it may be said that supertasks do not seem to be
intrinsically impossible. The contradictions that they supposedly give
rise to may be avoided if one rejects certain unwarranted assumptions
that are usually made. The main such assumption, responsible for the
apparent conceptual impossibility of supertasks, is that properties
which are preserved after a finite number of actions or operations will
likewise be preserved after an infinite number of them. But that is not
true in general. For example, we saw in section 1.2 above that the
relevant state of the world after the performance of a task T =
(a1, a2, … , an) on the
relevant state S was logically determined by T and by S (and was
an(an-1(an-2(…
(a2(a1(S)))…)))), but we have now learned
that after the performance of a supertask T = (a1,
a2, a3, …, an, …) it is
not (that is the core of Benacerraf's critique). The same sort of
uncritical assumptions seem to be in the origin of infinity paradoxes
in general, in which certain properties are extrapolated from the
finite to the infinite that are only valid for the finite, as when it
is assumed that there must be more numbers greater than zero than
numbers greater than 1000 because all numbers greater than 1000 are
also greater than zero but not viceversa (Galileo's paradox). In
conclusion, if some supertasks are paradoxical, it is not because of
any inherent inconsistency of the notion of supertask. This opinion is
adhered to by authors such as Earman and Norton (1996).
We have gone through several arguments for the conceptual impossibility
of supertasks and counterarguments to these. Those who hold that
supertasks are conceptually possible may however not agree as to
whether they are also physically possible. In general, when this issue
is discussed in the literature, by physical possibility is meant
possibility in relation with certain broad physical principles, laws or
‘circumstances’ which seems to operate in the real world,
at least as far as we know. But it is a well-known fact that authors do
not always agree about which those principles, laws or circumstances
are.
In our model of Thomson's lamp we are assuming that at each moment the
switch can be in just one of two set positions (‘off’,
‘on’). If there is a fixed distance d between them, then
clearly, since the switch swings an infinite number of times from the
one to the other from t = 12 A.M. until t* = 1 P.M., it will have
covered an infinite distance in one hour. For this to happen it is thus
necessary for the speed with which the switch moves to increase
unboundedly during this time span. Grünbaum has taken this
requirement to be physically impossible to fulfil. Grünbaum (1970)
believes that there is a sort of physical impossibility of a purely
kinematical nature (kinematical impossibility) and describes it in more
precise terms by saying that a supertask is kinematically impossible
if:
a) At least one of the moving bodies travels at an
unboundedly increasing speed,
b) For some instant of time t*, the position of at least one of the
moving bodies does not approach any defined limit as we get arbitrarily
closer in time to t*.
It is clear then that the Thomson's lamp supertask, in the version
presented so far, is kinematically (and eo ipso physically) impossible,
since not only does the moving switch have to travel at a speed that
increases unboundedly but also -because it oscillates between two set
positions which are a constant distance d apart- its position does not
approach any definite limit as we get closer to instant t* = 1 P.M., at
which the supertask is accomplished. Nevertheless, Grünbaum has
also shown models of Thomson's lamp which are kinematically possible.
Take a look at Figure 1, in which the switch (in position
‘on’ there) is simply a segment AB of the circuit
connecting generator G with lamp L. The circuit segment AB can shift
any distance upwards so as to open the circuit in order for L to be
dimmed. Imagine we push the switch successively upwards and downwards
in the way illustrated in Figure 2, so that it always has the same
velocity v = 1.
Figure 1
Figure 2
The procedure is the following. Initially (t = 0) the switch is in
position A′B′ (lamp dim) a height of 0.2 above the circuit
and moving downwards (at v = 1). At t = 0.2 it will be in
position AB (lamp lit) and will begin moving upwards (v = 1).
At t = 0.2 + 0.01 it will be in position A″B″ (lamp dim)
and will begin moving downwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.01 +
0.01 = 0.2 + 0.02 it will be in position AB (lamp lit) and will begin
moving upwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.02 + 0.001 it will be
in position A′′′B′′′ (lamp dim),
and so on. Obviously, between t = 0 and t* = 0.2 + 0.02 + 0.002 +
… = 0.2222… = 2/9, the lamp is in the states
‘dim’ and ‘lit’ an infinite number of times,
and so a supertask is accomplished. But this supertask is not
kinematically impossible, because it has been so designed that the
switch always moves with velocity v = 1 — and,
therefore, condition (a) for kinematical impossibility is not fulfilled
— and that, additionally, as we get closer to the limit time t* =
2/9 (the only one which could cause us any trouble) the switch
approaches more and more a well-defined limit position, position AB
(lamp lit) -and, therefore, condition b) for kinematical impossibility
is not fulfilled either. Once the kinematical possibility has been
established, what is the state of the lamp at t* = 2/9? What has been
said so far does not enable us to give a determinate answer to this
question (just as the obvious kinematical possibility of Achilles's
supertask in the dichotomy paradox does not suffice to determine where
Achilles will be at t* = 1 P.M.), but there exists a
‘natural’ result. It seems intuitively acceptable that the
position the switch will occupy at t* = 2/9 will be position AB, and so
the lamp will be lit at that instant. There is no mysterious asymmetry
about this result. Figure 3 shows a model of Thomson's lamp with a
switch that works according to exactly the same principles as before,
but which will yield the ‘natural’ result that the lamp
will in the end be dim at t* = 2/9. In effect, the switch will now
finally end up in the ‘natural’ position AB at t* = 2/9 and
will thereby bring about an electrical short-circuit that will make all
the current in the generator pass through the cable on which the switch
is set, leaving nothing for the more resistant path where the lamp is.
Figure 3
There are some who believe that the very fact that there exist
Thomson's lamps yielding an intuitive result of ‘lamp lit’
when the supertask is accomplished but also other lamps whose intuitive
result is ‘lamp dim’ brings up back to the contradiction
which Thomson thought to have found originally. But we have nothing of
that sort. What we do have is different physical models with different
end-results. This does not contradict but rather corroborates the
results obtained by Benacerraf: the final state is not logically
determined by the previous sequence of states and operations. This
logical indeterminacy can indeed become physical determinacy, at least
sometimes, depending on what model of Thomson's lamp is employed.
A conspicuous instance of a supertask which is kinematically
impossible is the one performed by Black's infinity machine, whose task
it is to transport a ball from position A (x = 0) to position
B (x = 1) and from B to A an infinite number of times in one
hour. As with the switch in our first model of Thomson's lamp, it is
obvious that the speed of the ball increases unboundedly (and so
condition a) for impossibility is met), while at the same time, as we
approach t* = 1 P.M., its position does not tend to any defined limit,
due to the fact that it must oscillate continuously between two set
positions A and B one unity distance apart from each other (and so also
condition b) for impossibility is met).
Up to this point we have seen examples of supertasks which are
conceptually possible and, among these, we have discovered some which
are also physically possible. For the latter to happen we had to make
sure that at least some requirements were complied with which,
plausibly, characterise the processes that can actually take place in
our world. But some definitive statement remains to be made about the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks: what the state of the world
is after they have been accomplished. The principles of physical nature
which have so far been appealed to do not enable us to pronounce on
this matter. The question thus arises whether some new principle of a
physical nature can be discovered which holds in the real world and is
instrumental in answering the question what the state of the world will
be after a supertask. That discovery would allow us to resolve a
radical indeterminacy which still persists -the reader will remember
that even in the case of Achilles's dichotomy supertask we were quite
unable to prove that it would conclude with Achilles in point B
(x = 1). In Section 2.1 we saw that such proof cannot be
obtained by recourse to the mathematical theory of infinite series
exclusively; why should it be assumed that this abstract theory is
literally applicable to the physical universe? After all, amounts of
money are added up applying ordinary arithmetic but, as Black reminded
us, velocities cannot be added up according to ordinary arithmetic.
Since Benacerraf's critique, we know that there is no logical
connection between the position of Achilles at t* = 1 P.M. and his
positions at instants previous to t* = 1 P.M. Sainsbury [1988] has
tried to bridge the gap opened by Benacerraf. He claims that this can
be achieved by drawing a distinction between abstract space of a
mathematical kind and physical space. No distinction between
mathematical and physical space has to be made, however, to attain that
goal; one need only appeal to a single principle of physical nature,
which is, moreover, simple and general, namely, that the trajectories
of material bodies are continuous lines. To put it more graphically,
what this means is that we can draw those trajectories without lifting
our pen off the paper. More precisely, that the trajectory of a
material body is a continuous line means that, whatever the instant t,
the limit to which the position occupied by the body tends as time
approaches t coincides precisely with the position of the body at t.
Moreover, the principle of continuity is highly plausible as a physical
hypothesis: the trajectories of all physical bodies in the real world
are in fact continuous. What matters is that we realise that, aided by
this principle, we can now finally demonstrate that after the
accomplishment of the dichotomy supertask, that is, at t* = 1 P.M.,
Achilles will be in point B (x = 1). We know, in fact, that as
the time Achilles has spent running gets closer and closer to t* = 1
P.M., his position will approach point x = 1 more and more,
or, equivalently, we know that the limit to which the position occupied
by Achilles tends as time get progressively closer to t* = 1 P.M. is
point B (x = 1). As Achilles's trajectory must be continuous,
by the definition of continuity (applied to instant t = t* = 1 P.M.) we
obtain that the limit to which the position occupied by Achilles tends
as time approaches t* = 1 P.M. coincides with Achilles's position at t*
= 1 P.M. Since we also know that this limit is point B (x =
1), it finally follows that Achilles's position at t* = 1 P.M. is point
B (x = 1). Now is when we can spot the flaw in the standard
argument against Zeno mentioned in section 2.1, which was grounded on
the observation that the sequence of distances covered by Achilles
(1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8, … ) has 1 as its limit. This
alone does not suffice to conclude that Achilles will reach point
x = 1, unless it is assumed that if the distances run by
Achilles have 1 as their limit, then Achilles will as a matter of fact
reach x = 1, but assuming this entails using the principle of
continuity. This principle affords us a rigorous demonstration of what,
in any event, was already plausible and intuitively
‘natural’: that after having performed the infinite
sequence of actions (a1, a2, a3,
… , an, … ) Achilles will have reached point B
(x = 1). In addition, now it is easy to show how, with a
switch like the one in Figure 2, Thomson's lamp in Figure 1 will reach
t* = 2/9 with its switch in position AB and will therefore be lit. We
have in fact already pointed out (3.1) that in this case, as we get
closer to the limit time t* = 2/9, the switch indefinitely approaches a
well-defined limit position -position AB. Due to the fact that the
principle of continuity applies to the switch, because it is a physical
body, this well-defined limit position must coincide precisely with the
position of the switch at t* = 2/9. Therefore, at t* = 2/9 the latter
will be in positon AB and, consequently, the lamp will be lit. By the
same token, it can also be shown that the lamp in Figure 3 will be dim
at time t* = 2/9.
In Section 3.2, the principle of continuity helped us find the final
state resulting from the accomplishment of a supertask in cases in
which there exists a ‘natural’ limit for the state of the
physical system involved as time progressively approaches the instant
at which the supertask is achieved. Now it is considerably more
problematic to apply this principle to supertasks for which there is no
‘natural’ limit. For an example, let us consider Black's
infinity machine, introduced in Section 2.4, and let us ask ourselves
where the ball will be at instant t* = 1 P.M. at which the supertask is
achieved. We can set up a reductio ad absurdum type of argument, as
follows. Assume that at t* = 1 P.M. the ball were to occupy position P,
that it was in point P. According to the principle of continuity, it
follows that the limit to which the position occupied by the ball tends
as time approaches t* = 1 P.M. is precisely position P. We know,
though, that Black's infinity machine makes the ball oscillate more and
more quickly between the fixed points A (x = 0) and B
(x = 1) as we get closer to t* = 1 P.M., so the position of
the ball does not approach any definite limit as we get closer to t* =
1 P.M. This conclusion patently contradicts what follows from the
principle of continuity. Therefore, the assumption that, after Black's
supertask is achieved (t* = 1 P.M.), the ball is at point P leads to
contradiction with the principle of continuity. Thus, the ball cannot
be at point P at t* = 1 P.M., and as the point can be any, given that
it has been chosen arbitrarily, the ball cannot be at any single one of
the points, which means that at t* = 1 P.M. the ball has ceased to
exist. This funny conclusion is consistent with the principle of
continuity, as we have just seen, but it enters into contradiction with
what could be termed the ‘postulate of permanence’: no
material body (and by that we mean a given quantity of matter) can go
out of existence all of a sudden, without leaving any traces. The
postulate of permanence seems to characterise our world at least as
evidently as the principle of continuity. Notice in particular that
certain physical bodies (particles) may dematerialise, but that is not
inconsistent with the postulate of permanence since such a
dematerialisation leaves an energy trace (which is not true of Black's
ball). Consequently, we can see that the case Black's infinity machine
is one in which the principles of continuity and permanence turn out to
be mutually inconsistent. As long as we do not give up any of them, we
are forced to accept that such an infinity machine is physically
impossible.
As we do not know exactly what laws of nature there are, it goes
without saying that the question whether a particular supertask is
physically possible (that is, compatible with those laws) cannot be
given a definitive answer in general. What we have done in 3 above is
rather to set out necessary conditions for physical possibility which
are plausible (such as the principle of continuity) and sufficient
conditions for physical impossibility which are likewise plausible
(such as Grünbaum's criterion of kinematical impossibility). In
this section we shall look into a problem related to the one just dealt
with, but one to which a definitive answer can be given: the problem of
deciding whether a certain supertask is possible within the framework
of a given physical theory, that is, whether it is compatible with the
principles of that theory. These are two distinct problems. At this
stage our object are theories whereas in 3 above we were concerned with
the real world. What we are after is supertasks formulated within the
defined framework of a given physical theory which can tell us
something exciting and/or new about that theory. We will discover that
this search will lead us right into the heart of basic theoretical
problems.
Classical dynamics is a theory that studies the motion of physical
bodies which interact among themselves in various ways. The vast
majority of interesting examples of supertasks within this theory have
been elaborated under the assumption that the particles involved only
interact with one another by means of elastic collisions, that is,
collisions in which no energy is dissipated. We shall see here that
supertasks of type w* give rise to a new form of
indeterministic behaviour of dynamical systems. The most simple type of
case (Pérez Laraudogoitia [1996]) is illustrated by the particle
system represented in Figure 4 at three distinct moments. It consists
of an infinite set of identical point particles P1,
P2, P3, … , Pn, …
arranged in a straight line. Take the situation depicted in Figure 4A
first. In it P1 is at one unity distance from the coordinate
origin O, P2 at a distance 1/2 of O, P3 at a
distance 1/3 of O and so on. In addition, let it be that all the
particles are at rest, except for P1, which is approaching O
with velocity v = 1. Suppose that all this takes place at t =
0. Now we will employ
Figure 4
the well-known dynamic theorem by which if two identical particles
undergo an elastic collision then they will exchange their velocities
after colliding. If our particles P1, P2,
P3, … collide elastically, it is easy to predict what
will happen after t = 0 with the help of this theorem. In the event
that P1 were on its own, it would reach O at t = 1, but in
fact it will collide with P2 and lie at rest there, while
P2 will acquire velocity v = 1. If P1
and P2 were on their own, then it would be P2
that would reach O at t = 1, but P2 will in fact collide
with P3, and lie at rest there, while P3 will
acquire velocity v = 1. Again, it can be said that if
P1, P2 and P3 were on their own, then
it is P3 that would reach O at t = 1, but in actual fact it
will collide with P4 and lie at rest there, while
P4 will acquire velocity v = 1, and so on. From the
foregoing it follows that no particle will get to O at t = 1, because
it will be impeded by a collision with another particle. Therefore, at
t = 1 all the particles will already lie at rest, which yields the
configuration in Figure 4B. Since P1 stopped when it
collided with P2, it will occupy the position P2
had initially (at t = 0). Similarly, P2 stopped after
colliding with P3 and so it will occupy the position
P3 had initially (at t = 0), … , etc. If we view each
collision as an action (which is plausible, since it involves a sudden
change of velocities), it turns out that between t = 0 and t = 1 our
evolving particle system has performed a supertask of type w.
The second dynamic theorem we will make use of says that if a dynamic
process is possible, then the process resulting from inverting the
direction in which all the bodies involved in it move is also possible.
Applying this to our case, if the process leading from the system in
the situation depicted in Figure 4A to the situation depicted in Figure
4B is possible (and we have just seen it is), then the process obtained
by simply inverting the direction in which the particles involved move
will also be possible. This new possible process does not bring the
system from configuration 4B back to configuration 4A but rather
changes it into configuration 4C (as the direction in which
P1 moves must be inverted). As the direct process lasts one
time unity (from t = 0 to t = 1), so will the inverse process, and as
in the direct process the system performs a supertask of type
w, in the inverse process it will perform one of type
w*. What is interesting about this new supertask of type
w*? What's interesting is that it takes the system from a
situation (4B) in which all its component particles are at rest to
another situation (4C) in which not all of them are. This means that
the system has self-excited, because no external influence has been
exerted on it, and, what is more, it has done so spontaneously and
unpredictably, because the supertask can set off at any instant and
there is no way of predicting when it will happen. We have found a
supertask of type w* to be the source of a new form of
dynamical indeterminism. The reason we speak of indeterminism is
because there is no initial movement to the performance of the
supertask. The system self-excites in such a way that each particle is
set off by a collision with another one, and it is the ordinal type
w* of the sequence of collisions accomplished in a finite time
that guarantees movement, without the need for a ‘prime
mover’. Now movement without a ‘prime mover’ is
precisely what characterises the dynamical indeterminism linked to
supertasks of type w*.
The previous model of supertask in the form of spontaneous
self-excitation is valid in relativistic classical dynamics as well as
non-relativistic classical dynamics and can also be extended - though
not in a completely obvious way, see Pérez Laraudogoitia [2001]
- to the Newtonian theory of universal gravitation. The core idea
behind indeterministic behaviour in all these cases is that the
configuration of a physical system consisting of a denumerable
infinite number of parts can be such that the solutions to the dynamic
equations - in principle, one for each one of the parts - turn out to
be coupled. A particular case of this situation (but probably the most
important case, as it is the one that can be generalised more
straightforwardly) is that in which the connection between solutions
stems from the fact that the dynamic equations themselves are coupled
as a result of the configuration of the system. Norton [1999] has
availed himself of precisely this possibility, thus introducing a
model of spontaneous self-excitation in quantum mechanics. Even though
the indeterminism vanishes in this case when the normalizability of
the state vector is imposed, this does not make his proposal any less
interesting: after all, the free particle solutions to Schrodinger's
equation are not normalizable either.
The physics of supertasks in the context of the other major closed physical theory, general relativity, will be the topic of the following two subsections.
Within relativity theory, supertasks have been approached from a
radically different perspective from the one adopted here so far. This
new perspective is inherently interesting, since it links the problem
of supertasks up with the relativistic analysis of the structure of
space-time. To get an insight into the nature of that connection, let
us first notice that, according to the theory of relativity, the
duration of a process will not be the same in different reference
systems but will rather vary according to the reference system within
which it is measured. This leaves open the possibility that a process
which lasts an infinite amount of time when measured within reference
system O may last a finite time when measured within a different
reference system O’.
The supertask literature has needed to exploit space-times with
sufficiently complicated structure that global reference systems cannot
be defined in them. In these and other cases, the time of a process can
be represented by its ‘proper time’. If we represent a
process by its world-line in space-time, the proper time of the process
is the time read by a good clock that moves with the process along its
world-line. A familiar example of its use is the problem of the twins
in special relativity. One twin stays home on earth and grows old.
Forty years of proper time, for example, elapses along his world-line.
The travelling twin accelerates off into space and returns to find his
sibling forty years older. But much less time — say only a year
of proper time — will have elapsed along the travelling twin
world-line if he has accelerated to sufficiently great speeds.
If we take this into account it is easily seen that the definition
of supertask that we have been using is ambiguous. In section 1 above
we defined a supertask as an infinite sequence of actions or operations
carried out in a finite interval of time. But we have not specified in
whose proper time we measure the finite interval of time. Do we take
the proper time of the process under consideration? Or do we take the
proper time of some observer who watches the process? It turns out that
relativity theory allows the former to be infinite while the latter is
finite. This fact opens new possibilities for supertasks. Relativity
theory thus forces us to disambiguate our definition of supertask, and
there is actually one natural way to do it. We can use Black's idea
— presented in 2.4 — of an infinity machine, a device
capable of performing a supertask, to redefine a supertask as an
infinite sequence of actions or operations carried out by an infinity
machine in a finite interval of the machine's own proper time measured
within the reference system associated to the machine. This
redefinition of the notion of supertask does not change anything that
has been said until now; our whole discussion remains unaffected so
long as ‘finite interval of time’ is read as ‘finite
interval of the machine's proper time’. This notion of supertask,
disambiguated so as to accord with relativity theory, will be denoted
by the expression ‘supertask-1’. Thus:
Supertask-1: an infinite sequence of actions or operations
carried out by an infinity machine in a finite interval of the
machine's proper time.
However we might also imagine a machine that carries out an infinite
sequence of actions or operations in an infinite machine proper time,
but that the entire process can be seen by an observer in a finite
amount of the observer's proper time.
It is convenient at this stage to introduce a contrasting
notion:
Supertask-2: an infinite sequence of actions or operations
carried out by a machine in a finite interval of an observer's proper
time.
While we did not take relativity theory into account, the notions of
supertask-1 and supertask-2 coincided. The duration of an interval of
time between two given events is the same for all observers. However in
relativistic spacetimes this is no longer so and the two notions of
supertasks become distinct. Even though all supertasks-1 are also
supertasks-2, there may in principle be supertasks-2 which are not
supertasks-1. For instance, it could just so happen that there is a
machine (not necessarily an infinity machine) which carries out an
infinite number of actions in an interval of its own proper time of
infinite duration, but in an interval of some observer's proper time of
finite duration. Such a machine would have performed a supertask-2 but
not a supertask-1.
The distinction between supertasks-1 and supertasks-2 is certainly
no relativistic hair-splitting. Why? Because those who hold that, while
conceptually possible, supertasks are physically impossible (this seems
to be the position adopted by Benacerraf and Putnam [1964], for
instance) usually mean that supertasks-1 are physically impossible. But
from this, it does not follow that supertasks-2 must also be physically
impossible. Relativity theory thus adds a brand-new, exciting extra
dimension to the challenge presented by supertasks. Earman and Norton
(1996), who have studied this issue carefully, use the name
‘bifurcated supertasks’ to refer specifically to
supertasks-2 which are not supertasks-1, and I will adopt this
term.
What shape does the philosophical problem posed by supertasks —
introduced in Section 1.2 — take on now? Remember that the
problem lay in specifying the set of sentences which describe the state
of the world after the supertask has been performed. The problem will
now be to specify the set of sentences which describe the relevant
state of the world after the bifurcated supertask has been performed.
Before this can done, of course, the question needs to be answered
whether a bifurcated supertask is physically possible. Given that we
agree that compatibility with relativity theory is a necessary and
sufficient condition of physical possibility, we can reply in the
affirmative.
Pitowsky (1990) first showed how this compatibility might arise. He
considered a Minkowski spacetime, the spacetime of special relativity.
He showed that an observer O* who can maintain a sufficient increase in
his acceleration will find that only a finite amount of proper time
elapses along his world-line in the course of the complete history of
the universe, while other unaccelerated observers would find an
infinite proper time elapsing on theirs.
Let us suppose that some machine M accomplishes a bifurcated
supertask in such a way that the infinite sequence of actions involved
happens in a finite interval of an observer O's proper time. If we
imagine such an observer at some event on his world-line, all those
events from which he can retrieve information are in the ‘past
light cone’ of the observer. That is, the observer can receive
signals travelling at or less than the speed of light from any event in
his past light cone. The philosophical problem posed by the bifurcated
supertask accomplished by M has a particularly simple solution when the
infinite sequence of actions carried out by M is fully contained within
the past light cone of an event on observer O's world-line. In such a
case the relevant state of the world after the bifurcated supertask has
been performed is M's state, and this, in principle, can be specified,
since O has causal access to it. Unfortunately, a situation of this
type does not arise in the simple bifurcated supertask devised by
Pitowsky (1990). In his supertask, while the accelerated observer O*
will have a finite upper bound on the proper time elapsed on his
world-line, there will be no event on his world-line from which he can
look back and see an infinity of time elapsed along the world-line of
some unaccelerated observer.
To find a spacetime in which the philosophical problem posed by
bifurcated supertasks admits of the simple solution that has just been
mentioned, we will move from the flat spacetime of special relativity
to the curved spacetimes of general relativity. One type of spacetime
in the latter class that admits of this simple solution has been dubbed
Malament-Hogarth spacetime, from the names of the first scholars to use
them (Hogarth [1992]). An example of such a spacetime is an
electrically charged black hole (the Reissner-Nordstroem spacetime). A
well known property of black holes is that, in the view of those who
remain outside, unfortunates who fall in appear to freeze in time as
they approach the event horizon of the black hole. Indeed those who
remain outside could spend an infinite lifetime with the unfortunate
who fell in frozen near the event horizon. If we just redescribe this
process from the point of view of the observer who does fall in to the
black hole, we discover that we have a bifurcated supertask. The
observer falling in perceives no slowing down of time in his own
processes. He sees himself reaching the event horizon quite quickly.
But if he looks back at those who remain behind, he sees their
processes sped up indefinitely. By the time he reaches the event
horizon, those who remain outside will have completed infinite proper
time on their world-lines. Of course, the cost is high. The observer
who flings himself into a black hole will be torn apart by tidal forces
and whatever remains after this would be unable to return to the world
in which he started.
The possibility of supertasks has interesting consequences for the
philosophy of mathematics. To start with, take a well-known unsolved
mathematical problem, for example that of knowing whether Goldbach's
conjecture is or is not correct. Goldbach's conjecture asserts that any
even number greater than 2 is the sum of two prime numbers. Nobody has
been capable of showing whether this is true yet, but if supertasks are
possible, that question can be resolved. Let us, to that effect,
perform the supertask of type w consisting in the following
sequence of actions: action a1 involves checking whether the
first pair greater than 2 (number 4) is the sum of two prime numbers or
not; let this action be accomplished at t = 0.3 P.M.; action
a2 involves checking whether the second pair greater than 2
(number 6) is the sum of two prime numbers or not; let this action be
accomplished at t = 0.33 P.M.; action a3 involves checking
whether the third pair greater than 2 (number 8) is the sum of two
prime numbers or not; let this action be accomplished at t = 0.333
P.M., and so on. It is clear that at t = 0.33333… = 1/3 P.M.,
the instant at which the supertask has already been performed, we will
have checked all the pairs greater than 2, and, therefore, will have
found some which is not the sum of two prime numbers or else will have
found all of them to be the sum of two prime numbers. In the first
case, we will know at t = 1/3 P.M. that Goldbach's conjecture is false;
in the seocnd case we will know at t = 1/3 P.M. that it is true. Weyl
(1949) seems to have been the first to point to this intriguing method
-the use of supertaks- for settling mathematical questions about
natural numbers. He, however, rejected it on the basis of his finitist
conception of mathematics; since the performance of a supertask
involves the successive carrying out of an actual infinity of actions
or operations, and the infinity is impossible to accomplish, in his
view. For Weyl, taking the infinite as an actual entity makes no sense.
Nevertheless, there are more problems here than Weyl imagines, at least
for those who ground their finitist philosophy of mathematics on
intuitionism à la Brouwer. That is because Brouwer's rejection
of actual infinity stems from the fact that we, as beings, are immersed
in time. But this in itself does not mean that all infinities are
impossible to accomplish, since an infinity machine is also ‘a
being immerse in time’ and that in itself does not prevent the
carrying out of the infinity of successive actions a supertask is
comprised of. It goes without saying that one can adhere to a
constructivist philosophy of mathematics (and the consequent rejection
of actual infinity) for diferent reasons from Brouwer's; supertasks
will still not be the right kind of objet to study either.
As Benacerraf and Putnam (1964) have observed, the acknowledgement
that supertasks are possible has a profound influence on the philosophy
of mathematics: the notion of truth (in arithmetic, say) would no
longer be doubtful, in the sense of dependent on the particular
axiomatisation used. The example mentioned earlier in connection with
Goldbach's conjecture can indeed be reproduced and generalised to all
other mathematical statements involving numbers (although, depending on
the complexity of the statement, we might need to use several infinity
machines instead of just one), and so, consequently, supertasks will
enable us to decide on the truth or falsity of any arithmetical
statement; our conclusion will no longer depend on provability in some
formal system or constructibility in a more or less strict
intuitionistic sense. This conclusion seems to lead to a Platonist
philosophy of mathematics.
However, the situation here is more subtle than the previous comments
suggest.Above I introduced a supertask of type w that can
settle the truth or falsity of Goldbach's conjecture, but the
reference (essential in it) to time contrasts with the lack of
specification regarding how to make the necessary computations.When
one tries to make up for this omission one discovers that the defence
of Platonism is more debatable than it seems at first sight. Davies
[2001] has proposed a model of an infinite machine (an infinite
machine is a computer which can carry out an infinite number of
computations within a finite length of time) based on the Newtonian
dynamics of continuous media which reveals the nature of the
difficulty. One cannot attempt to decide on mathematical questions
such as Goldbach's conjecture by using a mechanical computer which
carries out operations at an increasing speed, as if it were a Turing
machine. The reason is that the different configurations the computer
adopts at increasingly short intervals of time eventually (if the
conjecture is true) lead to a paradox of the type of Thomson's lamp,
where (if we do not assume continuity in the sense of section 3.2) the
final state of the computer is indeterminate, which makes it useless
for our purpose. Davies's clever solution consists in assuming an
infinite machine capable of building a replica of itself that has
twice its own memory but is smaller and works at greater speed. The
replica can in its turn build another (even smaller and quicker)
replica of itself and so on. With the details Davies gives about the
working of his infinite machines, it is clear that they will in no
case lead to an indeterminacy paradox (since each replica carries out
only a finite part of the task).The problem is that to settle
questions like Goldbach's conjecture (if, as I said above, it is true)
a numerable (actual) infinity of replicating machines is required, and
this will surely be rejected by anyone who, like intuitionists, has a
strong dislike of the actual infinity. In more abstract words, the
mathematical theory that models the computation process presupposes a
Platonic conception of the infinite and thus begs the question by,
circularly, supporting Platonism.
Similar comments can be made about the implications of supertasks
for the philosophy of mathematics if one only accepts the possibility
of bifurcated supertasks. Of course, a bifurcated supertask performed
in a non-Malament-Hogarth space-time would not be so interesting in
this sense. The obvious reason is that we would not even have a sound
procedure to determine the truth or falsity of Goldbach's conjecture
seen in 5.1 by means of the performance of an infinite sequence of
actions of order type w. To really have a safe decision procedure in
this simple case (as in other, more complex ones) there must
necessarily exist an instant of time at which it can be said that the
supertask has been accomplished. Otherwise, in the event that the
machine finds a counterexample to Goldbach's conjecture we will know it
to be false, but in the event of the machine finding none we will not
be able to tell that it is true, because for this there must exist an
instant of time by which the supertask has been accomplished and at
which we can say something like: "the supertask has been performed and
the machine has found no counterexamples to Goldbach's conjecture;
therefore, the conjecture is true". It follows that, in the case of a
bifurcated supertask, possessing a sound decision procedure on
Goldbach's conjecture requires the existence of an observer O such that
the infinite sequence of actions (of order type w) carried out by the
machine lies within the past light cone of an event on observer O's
world-line. But this is equivalent to saying that the relativistic
space-time in which the bifurcated supertask is performed is a
Malament-Hogarth space-time, and this realisation is one of the main
reasons why this sort of relativistic space-times have been studied in
the literature.
At first sight, the intuitionistic criticism of the possibility of
supertasks is less effective in the case of bifurcated supertasks,
because in this latter case it is not required that there is any sort
of device capable of carrying out an infinite number of actions or
operations in a finite time (measured in the reference system
associated to the device in question, which is the natural reference
system to consider). In contrast, from the possibility of bifurcated
supertasks in Malament-Hogarth space-times strong arguments seem to
follow against an intuitionistic philosophy of mathematics. But,
again, one must be very cautious at this point, as we were at the end
of our previous section 5.1. The mathematical theory which models a
bifurcated supertask is general relativity, and this theory, as it
fully embraces classical mathematical analysis, entails a strong
commitment to the - intuitionistically unacceptable - objective status
of the set of all natural numbers. It is difficult to believe,
therefore, that a radical constructivist lets himself be influenced by
the current literature on bifurcated supertasks. This does not make
that literature less interesting, as, in establishing unthought-of
connections between computability and the structure of space-time, it
enriches (as does the existing literature on supertasks in general)
the set of consequences that can be derived from our most interesting
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[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
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