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Identity Politics

First published Tue Jul 16, 2002; substantive revision Thu Jul 18, 2002

The laden phrase “identity politics” has come to signify a wide range of political activity and theorizing founded in the shared experiences of injustice of members of certain social groups. Rather than organizing solely around ideology or party affiliation, identity politics typically concerns the liberation of a specific constituency marginalized within its larger context. Members of that constituency assert or reclaim ways of understanding their distinctiveness that challenge dominant oppressive characterizations, with the goal of greater self-determination.

1. History and Scope

The second half of the twentieth century saw the emergence of large-scale political movements — second wave feminism, Black Civil Rights in the U.S., gay and lesbian liberation, and the American Indian movements, for example — based in claims about the injustices done to particular social groups. These social movements are undergirded by and foster a philosophical body of literature that takes up questions about the nature, origin and futures of the identities being defended. Identity politics as a mode of organizing is intimately connected to the idea that some social groups are oppressed; that is, that one's identity as a woman or as a Native American, for example, makes one peculiarly vulnerable to cultural imperialism (including stereotyping, erasure, or appropriation of one's group identity), violence, exploitation, marginalization, or powerlessness (Young 1990). Identity politics starts from analyses of oppression to recommend, variously, the reclaiming, redescription, or transformation of previously stigmatized accounts of group membership. Rather than accepting the negative scripts offered by a dominant culture about one's own inferiority, one transforms one's own sense of self and community, often through consciousness-raising. For example, in their germinal statement of Black feminist identity politics, the Combahee River Collective argued that “as children we realized that we were different from boys and that we were treated different — for example, when we were told in the same breath to be quiet both for the sake of being ‘ladylike’ and to make us less objectionable in the eyes of white people. In the process of consciousness-raising, actually life-sharing, we began to recognize the commonality of our experiences and, from the sharing and growing consciousness, to build a politics that will change our lives and inevitably end our oppression” (Combahee River Collective 1982, 14-15).

The scope of political movements that may be described as identity politics is broad: the examples used in the philosophical literature are predominantly of struggles within Western capitalist democracies, but indigenous rights movements worldwide, nationalist projects, or demands for regional self-determination use similar arguments. Predictably, there is no straightforward criterion that makes a political struggle into an example of “identity politics;” rather, the term signifies a loose collection of political projects that each articulate a collective with a distinctively different social location that has hitherto been neglected, erased, or suppressed. It is beyond the scope of this essay to offer historical or sociological surveys of the many different social movements that might be described as identity politics, although some references to this literature are provided in the bibliography; instead the focus here is to provide an overview of the philosophical issues in the expansive literature in political theory.

The phrase “identity politics” is also something of a philosophical punching-bag for a variety of critics. Often challenges fail to make sufficiently clear their object of critique, using “identity politics” as a blanket description that invokes a range of tacit political failings (as discussed in Bickford 1997). From a contemporary perspective, some early identity claims by political activists certainly seem naive, totalizing, or unnuanced. However, the public rhetoric of identity politics both served useful and empowering purposes for some, and belied more subtle philosophical understandings of what political liberation requires. Since the twentieth century heyday of the well known political movements that made identity politics so visible, a vast academic literature has sprung up; although “identity politics” can draw on intellectual precursors from Mary Wollstonecraft to Frantz Fanon, writing that actually uses this specific phrase, with all its contemporary baggage, is limited almost exclusively to the last 15 years. Thus it was barely as intellectuals started to systematically outline and defend the philosophical underpinnings of identity politics that we simultaneously began to deconstruct them. At this historical juncture, then, asking whether one is for or against identity politics is to ask an impossible question. Wherever they line up in the debates, thinkers agree that the notion of identity has become indispensable to contemporary political discourse, at the same time as they concur that it has troubling implications for models of the self, political inclusiveness, and our possibilities for solidarity and resistance.

2. Philosophy and Identity

From this brief examination of how identity politics fits into the political landscape it is already clear that the use of the controversial term “identity” raises a host of philosophical questions. Logical uses aside, it is likely familiar to philosophers from the literature in metaphysics on personal identity — one's sense of self and its persistence. Indeed, underlying many of the more overtly pragmatic debates about the merits of identity politics are philosophical questions about the nature of subjectivity and the self (Taylor 1989). Charles Taylor argues that the modern identity is characterized by an emphasis on its inner voice and capacity for authenticity — that is, the ability to find a way of being that is somehow true to oneself (Taylor in Gutmann, ed. 1994). While doctrines of equality press the notion that each human being is capable of deploying his or her reason or moral sense to live an authentic live qua individual, the politics of difference has appropriated the language of authenticity to describe ways of living that are true to the identities of marginalized social groups. As Sonia Kruks puts it:

What makes identity politics a significant departure from earlier, pre-identarian forms of the politics of recognition is its demand for recognition on the basis of the very grounds on which recognition has previously been denied: it is qua women, qua blacks, qua lesbians that groups demand recognition. The demand is not for inclusion within the fold of “universal humankind” on the basis of shared human attributes; nor is it for respect “in spite of” one's differences. Rather, what is demanded is respect for oneself as different (2001, 85).

For many proponents of identity politics this demand for authenticity includes appeals to a time before oppression, or a culture or way of life damaged by colonialism, imperialism, or even genocide. Thus for example Taiaiake Alfred, in his defense of a return to traditional indigenous values, argues that:

Indigenous governance systems embody distinctive political values, radically different from those of the mainstream. Western notions of domination (human and natural) are noticeably absent; in their place we find harmony, autonomy, and respect. We have a responsibility to recover, understand, and preserve these values, not only because they represent a unique contribution to the history of ideas, but because renewal of respect for traditional values is the only lasting solution to the political, economic, and social problems that beset our people. (Alfred 1999, 5)

What is crucial about the “identity” of identity politics appears to be the experience of the subject, especially his or her experience of oppression and the possibility of a shared and more authentic alternative. Thus identity politics rests on unifying claims about the meaning of politically laden experiences to diverse individuals. Sometimes the meaning attributed to a particular experience will diverge from that of its subject: thus, for example, the woman who struggles desperately to be thin may think that she is simply trying to be a better person, rather than understanding her experience as part of the disciplining of female bodies in a patriarchal culture. Making sense of such disjunctions relies on notions such as false consciousness — the systematic mystification of the experience of the oppressed by the perspective of the dominant. Thus despite its conflicts with Marxism and other radical political models, identity politics shares with them the anti-liberal view that individuals' perceptions of their own interests may be systematically distorted by ideology and must be somehow freed of their misperceptions by group-based transformation.

Concern about this aspect of identity politics has crystallized around the transparency of experience to the oppressed, and the univocality of its interpretation. Experience is never, critics argue, epistemically available with a singular meaning (Scott 1992); rather it requires a theoretical framework — implicit or explicit — to give it sense. Moreover, if experience is the origin of politics, then some critics worry that what Kruks (2001) calls “an epistemology of provenance” will become the norm: on this view, political perspectives gain legitimacy by virtue of their articulation by subjects of particular experiences. This closes off the possibility of critique of these perspectives by those who don't share the experience, which in turn inhibits political dialogue and coalition-building.

From these understandings of subjectivity, it is easy to see how critics of identity politics, and even some cautious supporters, have feared that it is prone to essentialism. This term is another philosophical term of abuse, intended to capture a multitude of sins. In its original contexts in metaphysics, the term implies the belief that an object has a certain quality by virtue of which it is what it is; for Locke, famously, the essence of a triangle is that it is a three-sided shape. In the contemporary humanities the term is used more loosely to imply, most commonly, an illegitimate generalization about identity (Heyes 2000). In the case of identity politics, two claims stand out as plausibly “essentialist:” the first is the understanding of the subject that makes a single axis of identity stand in for the whole, as if being Asian-American, for example, were entirely separable from being a woman. To the extent that identity politics urges mobilization around a single axis, it will put pressure on participants to identify that axis as their defining feature, when in fact they may well understand themselves as heterogeneous selves with multiple identities and political goals (Spelman 1988). The second form of essentialism is closely related to the first: generalizations made about particular social groups in the context of identity politics may come to have a disciplinary function within the group, not just describing but also dictating the self-understanding that its members should have. Thus, the supposedly liberatory new identity may inhibit autonomy, as Anthony Appiah puts it, replacing “one kind of tyranny with another” (Appiah in Gutmann ed. 1994, 163). Just as dominant groups in the culture at large insisted that the marginalized integrate by assimilating to dominant norms, so within some practices of identity politics dominant sub-groups may, in theory and practice, impose their vision of the group's identity onto all its members. For example, in his films Black Is, Black Ain't and Tongues Untied Marlon Riggs eloquently portrays the exclusion of Black women and gay Black men from heterosexist and masculinist understandings of African-American identity politics.

Philosophical discussion around the identities identity politics defends has thus centered on a familiar metaphysical tension between identity and difference, and the possibilities for solidarity when these opposites are transposed to political contexts. Postmodern critics have suggested that alterity from dominant norms and within and between marginalized group members is a better descriptive and normative social ontology. How can a politics of difference mediate a conventional liberal individualism and more traditional identity politics? This question reflects the tremendous ambivalence with which all interlocutors approach identity politics. Many commentators describe and theorize the experience of hybridity for those whose identities are especially far from norms of univocality: Gloria Anzaldúa, for example, famously writes of her mestiza identity as a Chicana, American, raised poor, a lesbian and a feminist, living in the metaphoric and literal Borderlands of the American Southwest (Anzaldúa 1999 [1987]). Some suggest the deployment of “strategic essentialism:” we should act as ifan identity were uniform only to achieve interim political goals, without implying any deeper authenticity (Spivak 1990, 1-16). Others argue that a relational social ontology, which makes clear the fluidity and interdependence of social groups, should be developed as an alternative to the reification of other approaches to identity politics (Young 2000; Nelson 2001). These new accounts of subjectivity, new ontologies, and new ways of understanding solidarity and relationships are perhaps the most interesting and important face of contemporary scholarship in identity politics.

3. Liberalism and Identity Politics

A key condition of possibility for contemporary identity politics was institutionalized liberal democracy (Brown 1995). The perceived paucity of rewards offered by liberal capitalism after the extension of formal rights to most adult citizens spurred forms of radical critique that sought to explain the persistence of oppression. At the most basic philosophical level, critics of liberalism suggested that liberal social ontology — the model of the nature of and relationship between subjects and collectives — was misguided. The social ontology of most liberal political theories consists of citizens conceptualized as essentially similar individuals, as for example in John Rawls' famous thought experiment using the “original position,” in which representatives of the citizenry are conceptually divested of all specific identities or affiliations in order to make rational decisions about social welfare (Rawls 1970). To the extent that group interests are represented in liberal polities, they tend to be understood as associational, forms of interest group pluralism whereby those sharing particular interests voluntarily join together to create a political lobby. Citizens are free to register their individual preferences (through voting, for example), or to aggregate themselves for the opportunity to lobby more systematically (e.g. by forming an association such as a neighborhood community league). These lobbies, however, are not defined by the identity of their members so much as by specific shared interests and goals, and their members are not taken to be peculiarly disadvantaged in pressing their case. Indeed, interest groups continue to include very powerful associations such as the National Rifle Association in the U.S., or tobacco company lobbies. Finally, political parties, the other primary organs of liberal democratic government, critics suggest, have few moments of inclusivity, being organized around party discipline, responsiveness to lobby groups, and broad-based electoral popularity. Ultimately conventional liberalism, diverse radical critics claim, cannot effectively address the ongoing structural marginalization that persists in late capitalist liberal states, and may even be complicit with it (Young 1990; P. Williams 1991; Brown 1995; M. Williams 1998).

On a philosophical level, these understandings of the political subject and its relationship to collectivity came to seem inadequate to ensuring representation for women, gays and lesbians, or racial-ethnic groups (M. Williams 1998). Critics charged that the neutral citizen of liberal theory was in fact the bearer of an identity coded white, male, bourgeois, able-bodied, and heterosexual (Young 1990). This implicit ontology in part explained the persistent historical failure of liberal democracies to achieve anything more than token inclusion in power structures for members of marginalized groups. A richer understanding of political subjects as deeply shaped by their social location was required. In particular, the history and experience of oppression brought with it certain perspectives and needs that could not be assimilated through existing liberal structures. Individuals are oppressed by virtue of their membership in a particular social group — that is, a collective whose members have relatively little mobility into or out of the collective, who usually experience their membership as involuntary, who are generally identified as members by others, and whose opportunities are deeply shaped by the relation of their group to corollary groups through privilege and oppression. Oppression, then, is the systematic limiting of opportunity or constraints on self-determination because of such membership: for example, Frantz Fanon eloquently describes the experience of being always constrained by the white gaze as a Black man: “I already knew that there were legends, stories, history, and above all historicity… I was responsible at the same time for my body, my race, for my ancestors” (Fanon 1968, 112). Conversely, members of dominant groups are privileged — systematically advantaged by the deprivations imposed on the oppressed. For example, in a widely cited article Peggy McIntosh identifies whiteness as a dominant identity, and lists 47 ways in which she is advantaged by being white compared with her colleagues of color. These range from being able to buy “flesh-colored” Band-Aids that will match her skin tone, to knowing that she can be rude without provoking negative judgments of her racial group, to being able to buy a house in a middle-class community without risking neighbors' disapproval (1993).

Critics have also charged that assimilation (or, less provocatively, integration) is a guiding principle of liberalism. If the liberal subject is coded in the way Young (1990) suggests, then attempts to apply liberal norms of equality will risk demanding that the marginalized conform to the identities of their oppressors. For example, many gays and lesbians have objected to campaigns to institute “gay marriage” on the grounds that these legal developments assimilate same-sex relationships to a heterosexual model, rather than challenging its terms. If this is equality, they claim, then it looks suspiciously like the erasure of socially subordinate identities rather than their genuine incorporation into the polity. This suspicion helps to explain the affiliation of identity politics with separatism. This latter is a set of positions that share the view that attempts at integration of dominant and marginalized groups so consistently compromise the identity or potential of the less powerful that a distinct social and political space is the only structure that will adequately protect them. In Canada, for example, Québec separatists claim that the French language and francophone culture are persistently erased within an overwhelmingly dominant Anglo-American continent, despite the efforts of the Canadian state to maintain its official bilingualism and to integrate Québec into the nation. Given their long history of conflict and marginalization, a separate and sovereign Québec, they argue, is the only plausible solution (e.g. Laforest in Beiner and Norman 2001). Analogous arguments have been made on behalf of Native American and other indigenous peoples and African Americans (e.g. Alfred 1999, Asante 2000). Lesbian feminist separatists have claimed that the central mechanism for the oppression of women under patriarchy is heterosexuality. Understanding heterosexuality as a forced contract or compulsory institution, they argue that women's relationships with men are persistently characterized by domination and subordination. Only divorce (literal and figurative) and the creation of new geographic and political communities of woman-identified women will end patriarchal exploitation, and forge a liberatory female identity (Rich 1980; Frye 1983; Radicalesbians 1988; Wittig 1992).

One of the central charges against identity politics by liberals, among others, has been its alleged reliance on notions of sameness to justify political mobilization. Looking for people who are like you rather than who share your political values as allies runs the risk of sidelining critical political analysis of complex social locations and ghettoizing members of social groups as the only persons capable of making or understanding claims to justice. After an initial wave of relatively uncompromising identity politics, proponents have taken these criticisms to heart and moved to more philosophically nuanced accounts that appeal to coalitions as better organizing structures. On this view, separatism around a single identity formation must be muted by recognition of the internally heterogeneous and overlapping nature of social group memberships. The idea of a dominant identity from which the oppressed may need to disassociate themselves remains, but the alternative becomes a more fluid and diverse grouping, less intent on guarantees of internal homogeneity and more concerned with identifying “family resemblances” than literal identity (Heyes 2000).

This trajectory — from formal inclusion in liberal polities, to assertions of difference and new demands under the rubric of identity politics, to internal and external critique of identity political movements — has taken different forms in relation to different identities. Increasingly it is difficult to see what divides contemporary positions, and some commentators have suggested possible rapprochements between liberalism and identity politics (e.g. Laden 2001). A problem in sorting through such claims is the vagueness of philosophical discussions of identity politics, which are often content to list their rubric under the mantra of “gender, race, class, etc.” although these three are not obviously analogous, nor is it clear which identities are gestured toward by the predictable “etc.” (or why they do not merit naming). Class in particular has a distinctively different political history, and contemporary critics of identity politics, as I'll discuss below, often take themselves to be defending class analysis against identity politics' depoliticizing effects. Of those many forms of identity politics to which large academic literatures attach, however, I'll briefly highlight key issues concerning gender, sexuality, disability, and a complex cluster of race, ethnicity and multiculturalism.

4. Gender and Feminism

Twentieth century feminism has consistently opposed biological determinism: the view that shared biological features among a certain group lead inevitably to certain social roles or functions. For example, one early opponent of women's suffrage suggested that women and men had different metabolic systems — katabolic (or “energy-expending”) in men, and anabolic (or “energy-conserving”) in women — that precluded women's effective or informed participation in politics (see Moi 2000, 3-21 for discussion). Feminist identity politics, then, takes up the task of articulating women's understandings of themselves (and of men) without reducing femininity (or masculine dominance) to biology, and instead situating women as oppressed under patriarchy. Two philosophical questions dog this endeavor: first, what to make of biological difference? In their eagerness to present gender as socially constructed and entirely separable from sex, feminists sidelined women's experiences of childbirth, menopause, or embodiment generally as “essentialist” and irrelevant to feminist politics. This gap is now being filled by so-called “sexual difference” feminism, but the legacy of social constructionism that reads gender identity only as a set of ideas rather than also embodied experiences has proved hard to shake. Second, the very idea of reclaiming women's identities from patriarchy has been criticized as merely an affirmation of a slave morality — a Nietzschean term describing the ressentiment of the oppressed as they rationalize and prescribe their condition. Attempts from various quarters to capture and revalue the distinctively feminine (by theorizing, for example, “maternal thinking,” [Ruddick 1989], or écriture féminine [Irigaray 1985]) risk endorsing existing power relations. Thus the heated debates surrounding the “ethic of care” in moral psychology, for example, line up around two constellations of positions: on the one hand, advocates of the ethic of care as a distinctively feminine contribution to moral reasoning point to its benefits for negotiating a social world characterized by webs of relationship, and to the pathologies of masculine disassociation. Carol Gilligan is the best known proponent of this position (although the details of her complex paradigm are often glossed or misrepresented) (Gilligan 1993 [1982]). Her critics charge that she reifies femininity — were women not oppressed, they would not speak in the voice of care, thus casting doubt on its usefulness as a liberatory strategy. The current construction of femininity is so deeply imbricated with the oppression of women that such attempts will always end up reinforcing the very discourse they seek to undermine (Butler 1999 [1990]); this critique has strong affiliations with poststructuralism (which are discussed below).

The narrative of feminist interpretation of gender relations most commonly offered points to universalizing claims made on behalf of women during the so-called “second wave” of the feminist movement in the late 1960's and 1970's in Western countries. The most often discussed (and criticized) second wave feminist icons — women such as Betty Friedan or Gloria Steinem — are white, middle-class, and heterosexual, although this historical picture too often neglects the contributions of lesbian feminists, feminists of color, and working-class feminists, which were less visible in popular culture, perhaps, but arguably equally influential in the lives of women. For some early radical feminists, women's oppression as women was the core of identity politics, and should not be diluted with other identity issues. For example, Shulamith Firestone, in her classic book The Dialectic of Sex, argued that “racism is sexism extended,” and that the Black Power movement represented only sexist cooptation of Black women into a new kind of subservience to Black men. Thus for Black women to fight racism (especially among white women) was to divide the feminist movement, which properly focused on challenging patriarchy, understood as struggle between men and women, the foundational dynamic of all oppressions (Firestone 1970, esp. 103-120).

Claims about the universality of gender made during the second wave have been extensively criticized in feminist theory for failing to recognize the specificity of their own constituencies. For example, Friedan's famous proposition that women needed to get out of the household and into the professional workplace was, bell hooks pointed out, predicated on the experience of a post-war generation of white, middle-class married women confined to housekeeping and child-rearing by their professional husbands (Friedan 1963; hooks 1981). Many women of color and working-class women had worked outside their homes (sometimes in other women's homes) for decades; some lesbians had a history of working in traditionally male occupations or living alternative domestic lives without a man's “family wage.” Similarly, some women from the Southern hemisphere have been critical of Northern feminist theory for globalizing its claims. Such moves construct Southern women, they argue, as less developed or enlightened versions of their Northern counterparts, rather than understanding their distinctively different situation (Mohanty 1988); or, they characterize liberation for Northern women in ways that exacerbate the exploitation of the South: by supporting economic conditions in which increasing numbers of western women can abuse immigrant domestic workers, for example (Anderson 2000).

Thus feminist claims made about the oppression of women founded in a notion of shared experience and identity are now invariably greeted with philosophical suspicion. Some critics have charged that this suspicion itself has become excessive, undercutting the very possibility of generalizations about women that gives feminist theory its force (Martin 1994), or that it marks the distancing of feminist philosophy from its roots in political organizing. Others suggest alternative methods for feminist theory that will minimize the emphasis on shared criteria of membership in a social group and stress instead the possibilities for alliances founded on non-identical connections (Young 1997; Heyes 2000; Cornell 2000). It is commonplace to hear that “identity” is a term in serious crisis in feminist thought, and that feminist praxis must move beyond identity politics (Dean 1996). Nonetheless, sex-gender as a set of analytical categories continues to guide feminist thought, albeit in troubled and troubling ways.

5. From Gay and Lesbian to Queer

Nowhere have conceptual struggles over identity been more pronounced than in the lesbian and gay liberation movement. The notion that sexuality provides a stable and authentic core identity has itself been profoundly challenged by the advent of queer politics. Most early lesbian and gay activists emphasized the authenticity of their identities; they were a distinctively different natural kind of person, with the same rights as heterosexuals (another natural kind) to find fulfillment in marriage, child-rearing, property ownership, and so on. This conformist strand of gay organizing (perhaps associated more closely with white, middle-class gay men, at least until the radicalizing effects of the AIDS pandemic) has a genealogy going back to pre-Stonewall homophilic activism. While early lesbian feminists had a very different politics, oriented around liberation from patriarchy and the creation of separate spaces for woman-identified women, many still appealed to a more authentic, distinctively feminist self. Heterosexual feminine identities were products of oppression, yet the literature imagines a utopian alternative where woman-identification will liberate the lesbian within every woman.

The paradigm shift that the term “queer” signals, then, is a shift to a model in which identities are more self-consciously historicized, seen as contingent products of particular genealogies rather than enduring or essential natural kinds (Phelan 1989 and 1994; Blasius 2001). Michel Foucault's work, especially his History of Sexuality, is the most widely cited progenitor of this view: Foucault famously argues that “homosexuality appeared as one of the forms of sexuality when it was transposed from the practice of sodomy onto a kind of interior androgyny, a hermaphrodism of the soul. The sodomite had been a temporary aberration; the homosexual was now a species” (Foucault 1980, 43). Although Foucault is the most often cited as the originator of social constructionist arguments about sexuality, other often neglected writers contributed to the emergence of this new paradigm (e.g. M. McIntosh 1968). In western popular culture such theories co-exist uneasily with biologically essentialist accounts of sexual identity, which look for a particular gene, brain structure, or other biological feature that will explain same-sex sexual desire. At stake are not only epistemic questions about the correct explanation for certain human behaviors, but also a host of moral and political questions. If sexual identity is biological, then no individual is morally responsible for it, any more than it makes sense to say that an individual is responsible for his or her race. Some gay activists thus see biological explanations of sexuality as offering a defense against homophobic commentators who believe that gays can voluntarily change their “immoral” behaviors. Indeed, much of the intuitive hostility to social constructionist accounts of sexuality within gay and lesbian communities seems to come from the dual sense of many individuals that they could not have been other than gay, and that anything less than a radically essentialist view of sexuality will open the door to further attempts to “cure” them of their homosexuality (through “ex-gay ministries,” for example).

Whatever the truth of these fears, Eve Sedgwick is right to say that no specific form of explanation for the origins of sexual preference will be proof against the infinitely varied strategies of homophobia (Sedgwick 1990, esp. 22-63). Queer politics, then, both stresses the usefulness of social constructionism while eschewing a genetic quest for the origins of homosexuality as always a presentist history. In addition to historicizing and contextualizing sexuality, including the very idea of sexual identity, the shift to queer is also characterized by deconstructive methods. Rather than understanding sexual identities as a set of discrete and independent social types, queer theorists emphasize their mutual implication: for example, the word “homosexuality” first appears in English in 1897, but the term “heterosexuality” is back-formed, first used some years later (Garber 1995, 39-42). Heterosexuality comes into existence as a way of understanding the nature of individuals after the homosexual has been diagnosed; homosexuality requires heterosexuality as its opposite, despite its self-professed essentialism. Queer theorists point out that the homo/hetero dichotomy, like many others in western intellectual history that it arguably draws on and reinforces, is not only mutually implicated, but also hierarchical (heterosexuality is superior, normal, and inevitable) and masquerades as natural or descriptive. The task of a more radical “identity politics,” on this vision, is to constantly denaturalize and deconstruct the identities in question, with a political goal of their subversion rather than their accommodation.

An exemplary conflict within the identity politics of sexuality focuses on the expansion of gay and lesbian organizing to those with other queer affiliations, especially bisexual and transgendered activists. Skepticism about inclusion of these groups in organizational mandates, community centers, parades, and festivals has origins in more traditional understandings of identity politics that see reclaiming lesbian and/or gay identity from its corruption in a homophobic society as a task compromised by those whose identities are read as diluted, treacherous, ambiguous, or peripheral. Lesbian feminist critiques of transgender, for example, see male-to-female transsexuals in particular as male infiltrators of women's space, individuals so intent on denying their male privilege that they will modify their bodies and attempt to pass as women to do it; bisexual women dabble in lesbian life, but flee to straight privilege when occasion demands (see Heyes 2003 for references and discussion). These arguments have been challenged in turn by writers who see them as attempts to justify purity of identity that merely replace the old exclusions with new dictatorships (Stone 1991, Lugones 1994) and inhibit coalitional organizing against conservative foes.

6. Disability

The trope of social constructionism reappears in disability studies as the argument that disability is not a natural or objective flaw of certain individuals, but rather a set of challenges faced by those whose needs the dominant culture fails to accommodate (Wendell 1996; Davis 1997). In a society in which buildings or communications systems, for example, were differently designed, many of the struggles of people currently labeled “disabled” would no longer be disadvantaged. This has been the basis for legislation (such as the 1990 Americans with Disabilities Act), which requires of employers that they make reasonable accommodation for disabled employees, to minimize the disadvantages they face. Disability rights language here draws on feminist discourse: if employers are obliged to accommodate childbirth and parental leave (when once they would have fired or not hired women who had or were thought likely to have children), then other embodied differences merit the same treatment in order that employees can perform to their full potential. Thus disability rights advocates use the familiar strategy of shifting moral responsibility for an identity away from those who involuntarily share it, towards those whose actions have made it oppressive.

That disability should be involuntary rather than chosen has become an important issue here (in some ways paralleling debates in sexuality studies). It is a trope of liberal discourse that one should not be held morally responsible for traits (or their consequences) that one cannot control; thus arguments from accommodation have come to depend on disability being understood as analogous to sex or race in its immutability. Yet life-long smokers with chronic lung disease, or the very obese (to take a particularly tricky example), also require changes to work schedules or physical environments to participate in public life. If choosing to act differently could ameliorate or dispel the disability in question, why should others accommodate it?

Many philosophers of disability suggest that these questions conceal a deeper issue: like many objectors to identity politics, those skeptical of accommodating the disabled are liable to assume a charity model. The disabled, they suggest, are simply a burden on the larger society, and their demands constitute special pleading. Yet like many marginalized groups, disabled rights advocates point out that experiences of disability are far from entirely negative, and in fact have value as source of knowledge or a standpoint unavailable to others (Wendell 1996). This argument has taken a particularly forceful turn within Deaf studies, where scholars have argued that the Deaf constitute a separate culture and linguistic minority (as users of sign languages) that should be preserved and fostered. New technologies (such as cochlear implants) promise to reduce the numbers of deaf people, and increase the proportion of the deaf and hard-of-hearing who can use spoken language to communicate with hearing culture. For some Deaf activists, this move is less the lifting of an unfortunate affliction than the genocide of an under-valued and stigmatized culture. Again, the identity of being Deaf is affirmed contra attempts to assimilate it to the terms of the hearing.

7. Race, Ethnicity, and Multiculturalism

Similar debates in philosophy of race highlight the socially constructed and historical nature of “race” as a category of identity. Despite a complex history of biological essentialism in the presentation of racial typologies, the notion of a genetic basis to racial difference has been discredited; the criteria different societies (at different times) use to organize and hierarchize “racial formations” are political and contingent (Omi and Winant 1986). While skin color, appearance of facial features, or hair type are in some trivial sense genetically determined, the grouping of different persons into races does not pick out any patterned biological difference. What it does pick out is a set of social meanings (Alcoff 1997). The most notorious example of an attempt to rationalize racial difference as biological is the U.S. “one-drop rule,” under which an individual was characterized as Black if they had “one drop” or more of “Black blood.” Adrian Piper points out that not only does this belief persist into contemporary readings of racial identity, it also implies that given the prolonged history of racial mixing in the US — both coerced and voluntary — very significant numbers of nominally “white” people in the U.S. today should be re-classified as “Black” (Piper 1996). In those countries that have had official racial classifications, individuals' struggles to be re-classified almost always as a member of a more privileged racial group are often invoked to highlight the contingency of race, especially at the borders of its categories. And a number of histories of racial groups that have apparently changed their racial identification — Jews, Italians, or the Irish, for example — also illustrate social constructionist theses (Ignatiev 1995).

The claim that race is socially constructed does not in itself mark out a specific identity politics. Indeed, the very contingency of race and its lack of correlation with ethnicity or culture circumscribes its political usefulness: just as feminists have found the limits of appeals to “women's identity,” so Asian-Americans may find with ethnicities and cultures as diverse as Chinese, Indian, or Vietnamese that their racial designation itself provides little common ground. That a US citizen of both Norwegian and Ashkenazi Jewish heritage will check that they are “white” on a census form says relatively little (although nonetheless something) about their experience of their identity, or indeed of their very different relationship to anti-Semitism. Tropes of separatism and the search for forms of authentic self-expression are related to race via ethno-cultural understandings of identity: for example, the U.S. Afro-centric movement appeals to the cultural significance of African heritage for Black Americans (Asante 2000).

Where perhaps racial categories are most politically significant is in their contested relation to racism. Racism attempts to reduce members of social groups to their racial features, drawing on a complex history of racial stereotypes to do so. Racism is arguably analogous to other forms of oppression in being both overt and institutionalized, manifested both as deliberate acts by individuals and as unplanned systemic outcomes. The specific direction of US discussion of the categories of race has been around color-blind versus color-conscious public policy (Appiah and Gutmann 1996). Color-blindness — that is, the view that race should be ignored in public policy and everyday exchange — has hegemony in popular discourse. Drawing attention to race — whether in a personal description or in university admissions procedures — is unfair and racist. Advocates of color-consciousness argue that racism will not disappear without proactive efforts, which require the invocation of race. Thus affirmative action, for example, requires statistics about the numbers of members of oppressed racial groups employed in certain contexts, which in turn requires racial identification and categorization. Thus those working against racism face a paradox familiar in identity politics: the very identity they aim to dispel must be invoked to make their case.

The literature on multiculturalism takes up questions of race, ethnicity, and cultural diversity in relation to the liberal state. Some multicultural states — notably Canada — allegedly aim to permit the various cultural identities of their residents to be preserved rather than assimilated, despite the concern that the over-arching liberal aims of such states may be at odds with the values of those they claim to protect. For example, Susan Moller Okin argues that multiculturalism is sometimes bad for women, especially when it works to preserve patriarchal values in minority cultures. If multiculturalism implies a form of cultural relativism that prevents judgment of or interference with the “private” practices of minorities, female genital mutilation, forced marriage, compulsory veiling, or being deprived of education may be the consequence. Okin's critics counter that she falsely portrays culture as static, internally homogeneous, and defined by men's values, allowing liberalism to represent a culturally unmarked medium for the defense of individual rights (Okin et al 1999). For many commentators on multiculturalism this is the nub of the issue: is there an inconsistency between defending the rights of minority cultures, while prohibiting those (allegedly) cultural practices that the state judges illiberal? Can liberalism sustain the cultural and value-neutrality that some commentators still ascribe to it, or to what extent should it embrace its own cultural specificity (Taylor, Habermas in Gutmann, ed. 1994; Lawrence and Herzog, eds. 1994; Kymlicka, ed. 1995)? Defenders of the right to cultural expression of minorities in multicultural states thus practice forms of identity politics that are both made possible by liberalism and sometimes in tension with it.

8. Other Challenges to Identity Politics

Since its 1970s vogue, identity politics as a mode of organizing and set of political philosophical positions has undergone numerous attacks by those motivated to point to its flaws, whether by its pragmatic exclusions or more programmatically as liberals, Marxists, or poststructuralists. For many leftist commentators, identity politics is something of a bête noire, representing the capitulation to cultural criticism in place of analysis of the material roots of oppression. Marxists, both orthodox and revisionist, and socialists — especially those who came of age during the rise of the New Left in western countries — have often interpreted the perceived ascendancy of identity politics as representing the end of radical materialist critique (see discussion in Farred 2000). Identity politics, for these critics, is both factionalizing and depoliticizing, drawing attention away from the ravages of late capitalism toward superstructural cultural accommodations that leave economic structures unchanged. For example, while allowing that both recognition and redistribution have a place in contemporary politics, Nancy Fraser laments the supremacy of perspectives that take injustice to inhere in “cultural” constructions of identity that the people to whom they are attributed want to reject. Such recognition models, she argues, require remedies that “valorize the group's ‘groupness’ by recognizing its specificity,” thus reifying identities that themselves are products of oppressive structures. By contrast, injustices of distribution require redistributive remedies that aim “to put the group out of business as a group” (Fraser 1997, 19).

The reasons given for this alleged turn away from economic oppression to themes of culture, language, and identity in contemporary politics differ. First, the institutionalization of North American radicalism in the middle-class bastion of academia creates incentives for intellectuals to minimize the political importance of their own class privilege, and focus instead on other identities (in turn divorced from their economic inflections). Second, Wendy Brown suggests that capitalist suffering has been displaced onto other identities, interpreted through the lens of class aspiration (Brown 1995, 59-60). Third, the turn away from economic analysis may be less dramatic than some critics believe: recent activism against global capitalism indicates a resurgence in economic critique that is now arguably more fully imbricated with identity politics (Lott 2000). Finally, the rise of diverse “postmodern” paradigms offers sophisticated theoretical alternatives to Marxism for those on the left.

Poststructuralist challenges to identity politics are perhaps the most philosophically developed and profound. Poststructuralists charge that identity politics rests on a mistaken view of the subject that assumes a metaphysics of substance — that is, that a cohesive, self-identical subject can be identified and reclaimed from oppression (Butler 1999). This subject has certain core essential attributes that define her or his identity, over which are imposed forms of socialization that cause her or him to internalize other nonessential attributes. This position, they suggest, misrepresents both the psychology of identity and its political significance. The alternative view offered by poststructuralists is that the subject is itself always already a product of discourse, that possibilities for subjecthood are set out in advance of any possible expression by an individual. Some critics are uncomfortable with the limitations on agency this seems to assume, but advocates argue that changing discourse itself is a better possible goal than reclaiming authentic identities; individual choices have a role to play in this project.

Also key to poststructuralist positions is the mutually sustaining opposition of identity and difference:

An identity is established in relation to a series of differences that have become socially recognized. These differences are essential to its being. If they did not coexist as differences, it would not exist in its distinctness and solidity. Entrenched in this indispensable relation is a second set of tendencies, themselves in need of exploration, to conceal established identities into fixed forms, thought and lived as if their structure expressed the true order of things. When these pressures prevail, the maintenance of one identity (or field of identities) involves the conversion of some differences into otherness, into evil, or one of its numerous surrogates. Identity requires differences in order to be, and it converts difference into otherness in order to secure its own self-certainty. (Connolly 2002, 64)

The dangers of identity politics, then, are that it casts as authentic to the self or group an identity that in fact is defined by its opposition to an Other. Reclaiming such an identity as one's own merely reinforces its dependence on this dominant Other, and further internalizes and reinforces an oppressive discourse. These moves cultivate ressentiment (the moralizing revenge of the powerless): while the charge that identity politics promotes a victim mentality is often facile, Brown makes a sophisticated version of the critique. She argues that identity politics has its own genealogy in liberal capitalism that relentlessly reinforces the “wounded attachments” it claims to sever: “Politicized identity thus enunciates itself, makes claims for itself, only by entrenching, restating, dramatizing, and inscribing its pain in politics; it can hold out no future — for itself or others — that triumphs over this pain” (Brown 1995, 74).

What political alternatives does this model imply? Proponents of identity politics have suggested that poststructuralism is politically impotent, capable only of deconstruction and never of action (Hartsock 1998, 205-226). Yet there are political projects motivated by poststructuralist theses. For example, Judith Butler's famous articulation of performativity as a way of understanding subject-development suggests to her and others the possibility of disarticulating seamless performances to subvert the meanings with which they are invested (Butler 1999). Drag can constitute such a disarticulation, although other critics have suggested other examples; Adrian Piper's conceptual art seeks to disrupt the presumed self-identity of race by showing how it is actively interpreted and reconstituted, never determinate and self-evident.

9. Identity Politics in the 21st Century

The continuing intellectual crisis surrounding identity politics paradoxically marks its importance to contemporary political philosophy and practice. Both flexible and extensible, identity political tropes continue to influence new political claims: can identity politics be extended to children, for example, as the emergent children's rights movement implies? Identity politics has limits, too: is it too person-centered? How can identity politics also be an environmental politics (Sandilands 2000)? Perhaps most important for philosophers, the idea of identity itself appears to be in a period of rapid evolution. Changing technologies are having a profound impact on our philosophical understandings of who we are. Attempts to decode human genetics and possibly shape the genetic make-up of future persons (Wald 2000), to clone human beings, or to xeno-transplant animal organs, and so on, all raise deep philosophical questions about the kind of thing a person is. We are capable of changing our bodies in ways that dramatically change our identities, including through sex change or cosmetic surgeries, with immediate consequences for the kinds of identities I have been discussing in this essay. As more and more people form political alliances using disembodied communications technologies, the kinds of identities that matter seem also to shift (Turkle 1995). Our identities are increasingly pathologized as syndromes and disorders and treated by psychiatrists, and political thinkers should continue to criticize and resist the tendency to dehistoricize and naturalize them (Elliott 2003). At the same time, familiar mechanisms of oppression are further entrenching the very identities that in some western, wealthy contexts look set to fragment. Global capitalism appears to be widening the gap between the North and South, and working to further marginalize women, ethnic or indigenous minorities, and the disabled in the so-called Third and Fourth Worlds.[1] This mass of shifts and contradictions helps explain one move that almost all intellectuals agree on: identity politics must adopt a local focus. Structures of oppression may operate at macro-levels, but their consequences for the lived experience of those whose self-determination they undermine are myriad.

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diversity | feminist (topics) | feminist (topics): perspectives on sexuality | feminist (topics): perspectives on the self | homosexuality | identity | liberalism | Marxism | race

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