Notes to Intensional Transitive Verbs

1. The domain invoked may be a domain of (specific) fictional entities, as in “Guercino drew all Santa's reindeers” (Donner, Blitzen, etc.). The coda ‘but no particular ones’ is no more successful in this case than with “Guercino drew all Aldrovandi's dogs”. See further discussion at the end of this article.

2. We have to say ‘fears-true’ since the simple ‘fears’ would result in the claim that Lex is afraid of the proposition. With other clausal verbs, such as ‘believes’, the ‘-true’ is not obligatory. For discussion of these phenomena, see (King 2002).

3. The point of ‘herself ’ is that the proposition Lois is trying to make true is one she would express with ‘I’; see (Kaplan 1986, 276, n.5).

4. But not for physical depiction verbs, where Hamlet ellipsis is not meaning-preserving: if someone paints Mary imagining a unicorn, the unicorn figure may clearly be depicted as a figment of Mary's imagination. And in more straightforward paintings of unicorns, the artist rarely depicts the subject as being spatially related either to him or herself or to the viewer. Nor is a self-portrait a portrait of the artist in front of himself.

5. I am skating over a complication here. In its first occurrence in (13), woollen must be of type (ib)(ib) for woollen(sweater) to be well-typed. But if a quantified NP requires ib input, the second woollen has to be of type ib, else (13) will be ill-typed. Evidently, we need a notational distinction between the two versions of woollen. But unless their meanings are somehow related, there is no reason to expect the result of modifying (13) by drawing the notational distinction to be true at every world. The solution is to define the (ib)(ib) version in terms of the ib version; see further (Forbes 2006:27, n.6).

6. On the face of it, this runs into trouble with ‘Someone hit Jack’, since (hit(jack))(someone) is ill-typed if hit expects an input of type (ib)b. For a good introductory discussion of various solutions to this problem, see Ch. 7 of (Heim and Kratzer 1998).

7. As the reader may surmise, this makes the notional reading of (18) unproblematic at the expense of making the relation reading problematic. For if the semantics follows the syntax, and there is only one way of syntactically forming (18), then (18) only has one reading, namely (19), and (19) is not relational any more than is want(^(a(golden(fleece))))(jason). But Montague proposes a second way of syntactically forming (18), by a substitution operation which allows a quantified NP to replace designated occurrences of ‘it’ in sentences. Thus (18) may be generated syntactically by substituting ‘a woollen sweater’ for ‘it’ in ‘Jack wants it’. The corresponding semantic rule gives a(woollen(sweater)) wide scope over wants. See further (Dowty et al., 1981, 219–20).

8. The higher-type assignment to a proper name is characteristic of Montague's own writings, but as Thomason emphasizes (p. 69, n.8), here it has a quite different motivation. Thomason's overall account, like Montague's, is a single-mechanism theory of the three marks of intensionality. It is worth mentioning that if substitution-failure is attributed to a separate mechanism, for example a ‘hidden indexical’ mechanism as proposed in (Crimmins 1992) or (Forbes 2000), there is no need to assign the more complex type (ip)p to cicero and tully rather than the simpler i. orator(cicero) and orator(tully) would then be the same proposition, as a non-Fregean would expect. For a Fregean, retaining Thomason's theory of compositionality would require reconstruing the category p as that of some more “objectual” sort of entity, such as a state of affairs.

9. I am ignoring a complication here. The Norton Simon curators say that Guercino's painting is of a specific dog. Perhaps you say otherwise. This seems to be a disagreement with a common core of agreement, for everyone agrees that Guercino painted a dog. In the nature of this case, what is agreed upon cannot be either specific or unspecific. One possibility is that (19) represents what is agreed on, something neutral between specific and unspecific. ‘But no particular one’ would then be what it seems to be, a second conjunct that rules out specificity. So it would be represented by conjoining to (19) the negation of the relational semantics of (18). See further (Forbes 2003, 52–4).

10. Unless he be a reader of the excellent (Proust 1998).

11. It would not do to object to this inference that he might think ‘mortal gorgon’ is like ‘toy spear’, for if one mechanism is responsible for substitution-resistance, say hidden indexicals, and another for the availability of unspecific readings, say dethematization, then we can evaluate the inferences on substitution-permitting readings, where the agent's conceptions of the objects of search cannot be appealed to to block inferences.

12. The conjunctive force readings are not obligatory, but preventing them normally requires the addition of a special coda, for example, ‘x is larger than y or z, and I know which’ or ‘John can speak French or Italian, we've still to find out which’.