Environmental Aesthetics

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Glenn Parsons and Allen Carlson replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Environmental aesthetics is a relatively new sub-field of philosophical aesthetics that took shape around the end of the twentieth century. Prior to its emergence, aesthetics within the analytic tradition was largely concerned with the philosophy of art. Environmental aesthetics originated in part as a reaction to this emphasis, shifting attention to the aesthetic appreciation of nature and the environment. Although natural environments have been a major focus, human and human-influenced environments have also been widely studied. With increasing impacts of climate-change blurring this distinction, philosophers have recently begun to grapple with the changing character and role of environmental aesthetics in the so-called “Anthropocene Era”.

The boundaries of environmental aesthetics are rather loose, a fact that reflects the flexibility of its central concept of environment. “Environment” can refer to an extensive, large-scale background or setting in which particular events occur (Sparshott 1972; Carlson 1979): a forest, an ocean, a wetland. But talk about the particular things that make up that background or setting—a species of fish, an underground thermal vent, a heron—is also, in a sense, talk about the environment (on the significance of the two senses of “environment”, see Parsons 2015a). Thus environmental aesthetics has naturally come to include the examination of everything save art—all that exists within various environments, including not only places and things but also events, processes, and activities, both natural and human-made.

This entry describes philosophical work on the aesthetics of environments understood in this broad sense. Such vast philosophical terrain has, understandably, also been surveyed from more particular perspectives. So-called “everyday aesthetics”, for instance, considers various elements of the environment from the perspective of ordinary life experiences (for an overview see Saito 2015 [2024]). The aesthetics of architecture focuses on the built structures that shape much of that experience (S. Fisher 2015 [2016]). Nature aesthetics, in contrast, focuses upon environments where non-human forces and elements predominate (see, for example Budd 2002; Moore 2008; Parsons 2023b). Other approaches foreground more specific concepts such as landscape (Benovsky 2016; Brook 2013; Andrzejewski & Salwa 2020) or place (Haapala 2005; Nomikos 2018). This entry, however, focuses on the issues of most general significance to environmental aesthetics.

These issues overlap significantly with those of environmental ethics, a field that originated at roughly the same time (see section 3 below). More broadly, the concerns of environmental aesthetics mesh, to some degree, with those of several academic fields beyond philosophy, notably environmental psychology, restoration ecology, and landscape architecture, as well as cultural geography, environmental history, ecocritical literary studies and those other areas of study grouped into the so-called “Environmental Humanities” (Emmett & Nye 2017; for a recent review of environmental aesthetics aimed at an interdisciplinary audience, see Brady & Prior 2020).

• 1. Historical Background
  • 1.1 Eighteenth Century Origins
  • 1.2 The Picturesque Legacy and Ecological Awareness
  • 1.3 The Emergence of Environmental Aesthetics
• 2. Contemporary Views
  • 2.1 Natural Environments
  • 2.2 The Aesthetics of Human Environments
• 3. Aesthetics and Environmentalism
  • 3.1 Aesthetic Protectionism
  • 3.2 Positive Aesthetics
  • 3.3 Aesthetics and Biodiversity
• 4. Themes and Directions in Recent Work
  • 4.1 What is “Ecological Aesthetics”?
  • 4.2 Global Perspectives
  • 4.3 The Sublime and the Picturesque
  • 4.4 The Aesthetics of Animals
  • 4.5 Mediated Appreciation
  • 4.6 Climate Change and Aesthetics
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Historical Background

Although environmental aesthetics developed as a sub-field of Western philosophical aesthetics only in the last fifty years, it has important historical roots in eighteenth and nineteenth century European and North American thought. Though humans no doubt always noticed the beauty or pleasantness of their surroundings, this period shows the first unequivocal emergence, in the West, of a focused aesthetic interest in landscape and natural surroundings. Key ideas articulated during this period, such as disinterestedness, the sublime, the picturesque, and positive aesthetics, continue to play a role in contemporary work in environmental aesthetics. Though the emphasis has been on these historical roots of environmental aesthetics in European thought, scholars have increasingly brought aesthetic traditions and theories from other cultures into the philosophical discussion (see section 4.2, below).

1.1 Eighteenth Century Origins

The eighteenth century was a period of unprecedented expansion in both the scope of appreciation of the environment and its theoretical articulation. Prior to this time, the environment had of course figured in various kinds of art. The rural landscape was a conventional setting for the Pastoral tradition in poetry, and painters had always rendered landscapes as part of their work. In these artistic traditions, however, landscape played a subsidiary role, typically serving as a backdrop for exploration of historical, religious, and moral themes. An early break with this relegation came in the work of seventeenth century painters such as Lorrain, Rosa, and Dughet, who brought landscape to the fore, positioning it as an interesting artistic subject in its own right (Clark 1949). The works of Lorrain, in particular, exerted a powerful pull on the British imagination and fueled a craze in landscaping and gardening, as aristocrats sought to cultivate Lorrain’s dreamy pastoral on their own estates. By the early nineteenth century, nature’s wilder side also took on a new allure as Europeans, warming to Romantic conceptions of nature, found an edgy fascination in the Alps, a landscape that had previously been regarded with various combinations of revulsion and fear.

Philosophers of this period attempted to map and understand these changes in Taste. In an important conceptual shift, eighteenth century philosophers pushed the traditional concept of the beautiful away from its classical associations with love, possession, and desire, emphasizing instead its disinterested character. This meant that a thing’s beauty was to be appraised apart from the appreciator’s particular personal, religious, economic, or utilitarian interests (a classic historical overview is Stolnitz 1961; for a recent reappraisal of the role of distinterestedness during the eighteenth century, see Guyer 2003, 2014) . However, the classical connotations of “beauty”—including not only love, but also order, proportion, and harmony—were sufficiently persistent to render it ill-suited for describing the new attractions listed above. Thus eighteenth-century writers reached for alternative vocabularies. Surroundings like those shown in Lorrain’s canvasses—subtly varied, irregular, delicate, and “fair” in color—came to be described as “picturesque” (Andrews 1989). Alpine peaks, in contrast, were understood in terms of the sublime, a concept that had been used in ancient rhetoric to describe the sort of expression accompanying great minds and powerful thoughts (Monk 1935; Nicholson 1959). Into the category of the sublime fell instances of the powerful, vast, intense, terrifying, and formless: storms, great voids, powerful waterfalls, and the like. Thus by century’s end there existed a triad of what were later recognized to be “aesthetic concepts”—the beautiful, the sublime, and the picturesque—each focusing on a contrasting aspect of nature’s perceptible character.

Philosophical treatises of the period by figures such as Shaftesbury, Hutcheson, Burke, and Alison analyzed these concepts and related them to one another, frequently discussing the appreciation of nature and landscape. Particularly influential was the account given by Kant in his Critique of the Power of Judgement (1790), in which nature was taken to be the exemplary object of aesthetic experience. Kant’s analysis of the idea of disinterestedness led him to emphasize the role of formal elements in the beauty of nature: a flower’s beauty is a matter of its shape and has nothing to do with its biological role in plant reproduction, or even its color. Alongside this account of beauty, Kant also offered a sophisticated analysis of the sublime that distinguished the experience of powerful natural objects (which he called the “dynamical sublime”) from the experience of vastness (the “mathematical sublime”). Despite the formalist bent of his account, Kant gave priority to natural beauty over that of art and argued that the experience of natural beauty and sublimity had a deep moral significance.

Kant’s writings ignored the picturesque, but of the three aesthetic concepts listed above, it was arguably the one that ultimately left the greatest legacy. In its initial use, the term “picturesque” seems to have simply meant “painterly”, as in “the sort of landscape painted by artists”. But the term took on added resonance in light of the close connections that came to be established between art and the appreciation of landscape in the late seventeenth century. The British aristocrats who reshaped their estates around picturesque ideals sought not only varied and irregular landscapes, but a view that in essence replicated the single-point perspective of a Lorrain canvas. Thus in practice the term “picturesque” often meant “picture-like”, and picturesque appreciation typically equated the experience of a landscape with the experience of a set of views, rather as if it were a set of large, out of doors paintings. This involved assessing the view’s “subject matter”, “composition”, “balance”, and so on. Thus, although philosophical theorists of the picturesque, such as Uvedale Price (1796), took a more nuanced view (see section 4.3 below), in practice the popular ideal of the Picturesque often equated nature and the environment, from an aesthetic point of view, with scenery. This ideal provided the paradigm for the nascent industry of scenic tourism, as travelers pursued picturesque views in the Lake District, the Scottish Highlands, and the Wye valley with the help of guidebooks by popular authors such as William Gilpin (for a history of the Picturesque movement in Britain see Andrews 1989; for an analysis of its key philosophical texts see Costelloe 2013).

1.2 The Picturesque Legacy and Ecological Awareness

After flowering in the eighteenth century, the aesthetics of nature went into decline. The cultish enthusiasms that had developed around the picturesque and the sublime subsided as these notions faded into clichés and ultimately blended into one another. The change is vividly illustrated by shifting attitudes toward the Alps, which in the early 1800s filled Romantic poets such as Byron and Shelley with sublime feeling. By the second half of the century, visitors found such feelings elusive quarry amid the tourists swarming Swiss towns like Chamonix on packaged tours (Colley 2010). In philosophy, Kant’s influential successor Hegel viewed art, along with religion and philosophy, as an important embodiment of “Absolute Spirit” and saw it, rather than nature, as the favored subject of philosophical aesthetics. In the nineteenth century, both on the continent and in the United Kingdom, relatively few philosophers and only a scattering of thinkers of the Romantic movement seriously pursued theoretical study of the aesthetics of nature.

Meanwhile, however, a different perspective was taking shape across the Atlantic. North American pioneers had viewed the “wilderness” landscape that greeted them with a mixture of fear and hostility and saw its conquest as their main priority (Nash 2001). But by the mid nineteenth-century Americans were confronted with a landscape that, within living memory, had gone from “forest primeval” to a frontier swiftly receding under the advance of industry and colonization. Scientific figures such George Perkins Marsh (Marsh 1865) raised concerns that the continued destruction of American wilderness would have disastrous consequences on critical resources such as forest watersheds. Philosophers such as Emerson and Thoreau put forth the novel view that wilderness had a crucial spiritual value that demanded its protection. The shift in attitudes toward wilderness ultimately took form in the US government’s designation of the first protected areas in Yosemite and Yellowstone in the late 1800s (Nash 2001).

It was aesthetic values, however, that played a central, though controversial, role in these events (Hargrove 1979). The protection of Yellowstone and eventual creation of a system of National Parks based on its model were primarily driven, not by love of wilderness or the aim of ecological protection, but by the desire to preserve America’s most impressive scenery. This aim was both nationalistic, being a means for the young Republic to assert its “visual supremacy” over Europe, and commercial, given the tantalizing possibilities for recreational and scenic tourism via the nation’s emerging railways (Runte 2022). Yellowstone and Yosemite were often discussed in an explicitly art-like fashion as “Nature’s masterpieces”, and renderings of the Western landscape by painters such as Moran, Hill, and Bierstadt helped translate Western landscapes into the visual idiom of the European Picturesque (Conron 2000; Wilton & Barringer 2002). As the National Park system took shape in the twentieth century, the Picturesque mutated into new forms, with Gilpin’s toolkit of sketchpad, Claude glass, and hiking boots evolving into the pocket camera, the automobile, and the roadside viewpoint: the tourist trope that Donald Crawford called the “postcardesque” (Crawford 2004). Indeed, the “scenic tourism” paradigm—the legacy of the eighteenth century Picturesque—not only spurred development of the Park system but dominated park management thinking for roughly a century (Sellars 1997).

However, though the Picturesque proved a resilient—indeed dominant—force, some early conservationists viewed the Park system’s fixation on scenery as a mistake. In their struggle to reorient park policies toward ecological aims and priorities, they sought different ways of understanding nature’s aesthetic value. Though they too applied the categories inherited from eighteenth century aesthetics, in their hands these were altered and reshaped by a growing awareness of the ecological relationships connecting humans, animals, and the land. John Muir, the most prominent public advocate of nature protection in nineteenth century America, is a case in point. In his well-known essay “A Near View of the High Sierra”, Muir contrasted his own experience of nature with that of his artist companions, who, guided by the idea of the picturesque, focused only on finding suitable views (Muir 1894). Muir’s own aesthetic, in contrast, incorporated a blend of religious feeling for, and geological interest in, the mountain environment. Muir also used the traditional idea of the sublime in describing his experience of nature, reinterpreting it to fit his own experience of this “new world” environment (Brady 2018). Similar ideas about natural beauty and its relation to the naturalist’s perspective were pursued by later environmental thinkers, notably the forestry scientist Aldo Leopold (1966).

This ecological perspective brought thinkers like Muir to see the whole of the natural environment, and especially wild nature, as beautiful and to find ugliness primarily where nature was subject to human intrusion. The range of things that Muir regarded as aesthetically valuable seemed to encompass the entire natural world, from creatures considered hideous in his day, such as snakes and alligators, to natural disasters thought to ruin the environment, such as floods, fires, and earthquakes. This view, which has come to be known as “positive aesthetics”, eschews humanity’s marks on the natural environment. As such, it represents a sort of converse of the Picturesque, which found interest and delight in evidence of human presence (Carlson 1984a).

These important shifts in cultural attitudes were more or less completely ignored by Anglo-American philosophy. Though some philosophers of the period (Santayana, Dewey, and Ducasse for examples) did discuss the aesthetics of landscape or nature, this was as an afterthought to their consideration of the arts. Indeed, by the mid-twentieth century, within analytic philosophy, the principal philosophical school in the English-speaking world at that time, philosophical aesthetics was virtually equated with philosophy of art. The leading aesthetics textbook of the period was subtitled Problems in the Philosophy of Criticism and opened with the assertion:

There would be no problems of aesthetics, in the sense in which I propose to mark out this field of study, if no one ever talked about works of art. (Beardsley 1958: 1)

Though meant to emphasize the importance of the analysis of language, the remark also reveals the art-dominated construal of aesthetics of that time. Some of the major figures working in the field in the second half of the century portrayed aesthetic judgments, or important aspects of them, as conceptually dependent upon the cultural constraints, norms, and conventions that apply to works of art (Walton 1970; Dickie 1974). Nature, by definition existing beyond this “cultural matrix”, therefore was, when considered at all, viewed as problematic as an object of aesthetic appreciation.

1.3 The Emergence of Environmental Aesthetics

The study of nature aesthetics was ultimately rejuvenated in the 1960s after a sense of environmental crisis took hold of popular consciousness, leading to the emergence of the modern environmental movement. One important practical development was the passage of protective environmental legislation in the US and UK. Since some of these laws made reference to “natural beauty” or “aesthetic values”, clarifying these notions and determining how to measure them became matters of practical, rather than merely philosophical, importance. This led to the development of empirical methods for “visual landscape quality assessment” (VLQA) and to attempts to provide a theoretical framework for their use (on the origin of VLQA see Zube, Sell, & Taylor 1982; for recent overviews of the field see Daniel 2001; C. Thompson & Tarvlou 2009). The latter included appeals to ideas in developmental and environmental psychology (Kaplan & Kaplan 1989; Bourassa 1991) as well as evolutionary psychology (Appleton 1975a, 1982; Orians 1986; Orians & Heerwagen 1992), an approach that has attracted much philosophical attention (Davies 2012; Paden, Harmon, & Milling 2012; Bartalesi & Portera 2015; Paden 2015a, 2016).

A second source of theoretical work was the nascent field of environmental philosophy, which produced works that appealed to beauty and aesthetics as elements in a wider environmental philosophy (see, e.g., Shepard 1967 [1991]). Within philosophical aesthetics itself, however, the impetus for renewed attention to nature came largely from Ronald Hepburn’s essay “Contemporary Aesthetics and the Neglect of Natural Beauty” (Hepburn 1966), which is widely recognized as setting the agenda for the aesthetics of nature for the late twentieth century (Brook 2010; Sepänmaa 2010; Carlson 2014; Saito 2014). After noting that analytic aesthetics had virtually ignored the natural world, Hepburn argued that an account of the appreciation of nature would have to do more than simply extend principles appropriate to the appreciation of art: it would need to acknowledge the features distinctive to nature as an object of appreciation . He claimed that in the aesthetic appreciation of nature, as in the appreciation of art, there is a distinction between appreciation that is only trivial and superficial and that which is “serious” and “deep”. Hepburn suggested that the latter must acknowledge not only nature’s indeterminate and varying character, but also both our multi-sensory experience and our diverse understanding of it. In short, nature is of no less aesthetic interest than art, and ought to be appreciated based on principles appropriate to it, rather than principles arbitrarily imported from the Arts.

In an aside, Hepburn attributed the decline in philosophical interest in the aesthetics of nature, in part, to a degradation of our experience of nature itself, referring to the “forced ecstasies and hypocrisies of a fashionable and trivialized nature-cult” (1966: 286). Hepburn’s swipe at the standardized “scenic aesthetic” of motorized tourism was an oblique one, but Allen Carlson developed this theme into an explicit analysis and critique (Carlson 1977, 1979). The foundation of the “scenic aesthetic”, Carlson argued, was what he called “the landscape model” of nature appreciation, which proposes appreciating nature more or less as we appreciate landscape paintings. This requires treating the environment as if it were a series of two-dimensional scenes and focusing either on artistic qualities dependent upon romantic images of the kind associated with the idea of the picturesque or simply on its formal aesthetic qualities. Carlson further argued that the VLQA techniques used to measure aesthetic value for the purposes of environmental management were in fact premised on this model and were therefore inadequate (Carlson 1977; see also Sagoff 1974). Carlson’s critique of VLQA methodology connected directly to debates within the field itself over the supposed lack of an adequate conceptual framework to support empirical work, or what one critic called the field’s “theoretical vacuum” (Appleton 1975b; see also Sparshott 1972, Ribe 1982, Carlson 1984b). Despite this overlap, philosophical and empirical debates concerning nature’s aesthetic value have largely continued to play out independently (though see the discussion of “ecological aesthetics” in section 4.1, below).

In the wake of the work done by Hepburn and Carlson, and in the context of growing general interest in environmental issues, the dismissal of nature as of little aesthetic interest no longer seemed so compelling. In the discussions that followed, there were some rearguard attempts to defend the neglect of natural beauty. One line of thought, for example, argued that because nature is not intentionally designed, it cannot be aesthetically appreciated (Mannison 1980; Elliot 1982; though see Elliot 1997). However, such views found little support, in part because so many of our fundamental paradigms of aesthetic experience seem to involve nature: for example, our delight in a sunset or in a bird in flight (Sibley 2001a). Moreover, one important strand in the Western tradition of aesthetics—the idea that anything that can be viewed can be viewed aesthetically—rendered the exclusion of the natural world arbitrary (Stolnitz 1960, Ziff 1979).

On the whole, subsequent work in environmental aesthetics has accepted the possibility that nature and the environment in general can be aesthetically appreciated and has sought to understand such appreciation. The result has been the mapping of a wide range of possibilities concerning what the appreciation of nature involves, how it ought to be cultivated, and what it implies about our treatment of, and relationship to, nature and the environment. Nevertheless, the thought that environmental appreciation remains in some way subordinate to, or conceptually dependent upon, the appreciation of art has persisted as a lingering, if rarely explicit, theme (for a sophisticated version of the “art-first” thesis, see Gaut 2007: 34–41).

2. Contemporary Views

In this section we provide an overview of work on the aesthetics of both natural and humanized, or “mixed”, environments. We highlight the seminal contributions of Allen Carlson and Arnold Berleant, given that most subsequent work has either directly responded to their views and/or tacitly employed their framing of key issues.

2.1 Natural Environments

Alongside his critique of the “scenic aesthetic”, Carlson developed the ideas of environmental thinkers such as Leopold and Muir into an alternative view that he originally called the “natural environmental model” of aesthetic appreciation (hereafter “NEM”; Carlson 1979). On this view, appropriately appreciating a natural environment requires regarding it as the particular sort of environment that it is: that is to say, in terms of the characterization of that environment provided by natural science. Though this view rejects the appreciation of nature as if it were art (as on the Picturesque-inspired “landscape model”), Carlson argued for it by appealing to a general analogy between nature and art. Just as “serious” or appropriate aesthetic appreciation of art requires some knowledge of art history and art criticism, such appreciation of nature requires some knowledge of natural history: that is, knowledge provided by the natural sciences, especially geology, biology, and ecology. For instance, appropriate appreciation of a work such as Picasso’s Guernica (1937) requires that we experience it as what it is—a cubist painting—and therefore that we appreciate it in light of our knowledge of paintings in general and of cubist paintings in particular (Walton 1970). The NEM applies the same reasoning to natural things, asserting that scientific understanding of nature can reveal the aesthetic qualities of natural objects and environments in the way in which knowledge about art history and art criticism so for works of art. In addition to this analogical argument, Carlson and other defenders of this approach also offered broadly ethical reasons to support it, holding, for instance, that ecologically-informed appreciation of nature leads to better treatment of the environment or greater support for more progressive environment protection (Carlson 1981, Saito 1998b; for critical discussion see Stecker 2012, Parsons 2018). Following his initial presentation of the NEM, Carlson further developed and qualified the view (Carlson 1981, 2000, 2007): variations of it have been defended by a number of other philosophers (Callicott 1994, 2003; Rolston 1995; Eaton 1998; Fudge 2001; Matthews 2002; Parsons 2002, 2006a, 2006b; Parsons & Carlson 2004, 2008).

While these views aimed to extend accepted ideas about art appreciation to nature, Arnold Berleant’s approach was based instead on a radical rejection of many traditional ideas about aesthetic appreciation. According to his “aesthetics of engagement”, disinterested appreciation, with its isolating, distancing, and objectifying gaze, is out of place in the aesthetic experience of nature, wrongly abstracting both natural objects and appreciators from the environments in which they properly belong and in which appropriate appreciation is achieved. Instead, the aesthetics of engagement stresses the contextual dimensions of nature and our multi-sensory experiences of it. Viewing the environment as a seamless unity of places, organisms, and perceptions, it challenges the importance of traditional dichotomies, such as that between subject and object. It beckons appreciators to immerse themselves in the natural environment and to reduce to as small a degree as possible the distance between themselves and the natural world. In short, appropriate aesthetic experience involves the total immersion of the appreciator in the object of appreciation (Berleant 1985, 1988, 1992, 2013b; for critical discussion see Carlson 1993, Budd 2002). Like Carlson’s NEM, Berleant’s approach was taken up by later writers (on the reception of Berleant’s views, see the essays in Łukaszewicz Alvarez 2017 and Gladden-Obidzińska 2021).

Indeed, the stark dichotomy between the NEM and the aesthetics of engagement evolved into a set of distinctions widely used to organize the field, with positions being categorized as either “cognitive” or “non-cognitive” (Godlovitch 1994; Eaton 1998; Carlson & Berleant 2004), “conceptual” or “non-conceptual” (Moore 1999), or “narrative” and “ambient” (Foster 1998). Roughly, such distinctions marked a division between positions that take knowledge and information to be essential to aesthetic appreciation of environments, as per the NEM, and those that, like the aesthetics of engagement, downplay this aspect and emphasize other dimensions of appreciation. On the “cognitive” side we find, in addition to the NEM, views that require the belief that nature has a non-human origin (e.g., Budd 2002) as well as views that highlight other sources of belief such as local and regional narratives, folklore, art, and mythological stories about nature (Sepänmaa 1986 [1993], 2004; Saito 1998b; Heyd 2001; Leddy 2005; Tafalla 2010). Because of this diversity amongst the “cognitivist” views, the term “scientific cognitivism” was introduced as a name for the NEM. On the “non-cognitive side” of the ledger, we find views that emphasize the role of emotion (Carroll 1993), a sense of mystery in nature’s otherness (Godlovitch 1994), “formal qualities” (Zangwill 2001, 2005a, 2005b, 2013), metaphysical ideas and insights (Hepburn 1996), and imagination (Brady 1998, 2003).

Despite its prevalence, this cognitive/non-cognitive taxonomy is ill-founded from a logical point of view and obscures some central issues in the field. One problem is that it conflicts with a more well-established philosophical usage on which “non-cognitive” means lacking in truth value, or purely emotive. In this sense, most of the views described above would be accurately described as “cognitive”, given that they involve beliefs and judgments. More importantly, this taxonomy runs together two issues—which mental faculties have an important role in aesthetic appreciation and whether scientific understanding is necessary for it—that are better distinguished from one another (Parsons 2023b). For instance, the taxonomy separates views that accord central roles to imagination or emotion from those that give an essential role to scientific understanding. But these features are by no means exclusive: scientific understanding can engender emotional responses, and imagination can take flight from, and inform, scientific understanding. It is the second issue that in fact separates these two camps: that is, the salient issue is whether beliefs based in science or natural history are essential, in some sense, for “correct” or “appropriate” aesthetic appreciation, as the NEM asserts, thereby normatively constraining permissible forms of imagining, emotional response, and engagement.

On that issue, a number of philosophers have argued that such scientifically informed beliefs are not necessary for appropriate appreciation, on grounds many and various: that the NEM’s appeal to science simply confuses facts and values (Berleant 2016; Newman, Varner, & Linquist 2017); that it conflicts with the disinterestedness of aesthetic experience (Zangwill 2013); that the potential range of such belief is too great (Stecker 1997; Budd 2002); that it unduly limits the scope of aesthetic experience (Heyd 2001; Brady 2003; Zangwill 2005b); and that such beliefs are too abstract to affect aesthetic experience (Heyd 2001; Hill & Daniel 2008). Some proponents of these criticisms see science as incompatible with aesthetic appreciation altogether, whereas others allow that scientifically-informed appreciation is possible, though merely one of a plurality of valid forms of appreciation (see, e.g., Ross 2005).

This last point highlights the fact that those who reject the essential role for scientific knowledge proposed by the NEM and related views still face the broader question of how to draw the normative boundaries of nature appreciation. Is any appreciation of a natural environment as acceptable, as appropriate, as any other? An affirmative answer yields a strongly relativist view: any response to nature is permissible, whether based on associations with myth, art, or merely on personal fancy, so long as it enhances one’s appreciation in some way (Heyd 2001; for a classic articulation, see Croce 1902 [1909/1922]). Among those rejecting the NEM, however, a simple relativism has not been a popular option (Maskit 2014). More common is an at least tacit appeal to some alternative set of normative constraints.

Zangwill, for instance, holds that aesthetic appreciation (about inorganic nature at least) must involve only beliefs about perceptual form (2001). Others argue that nature appreciation is constrained only by an awareness that what is appreciated is natural, rather than artifactual (J. Fisher 1998; Budd 2002), without any deeper scientific understanding being necessary. Yuriko Saito proposes a moral criterion; appreciation is appropriate so long as it makes nature and its origins the center of a narrative that informs our experience of it (1998a; 1998b). Such an attitude has a moral dimension, in Saito’s view, insofar as it expresses a recognition of the autonomous value of that which is appreciated (see also Parsons 2018). Hepburn also suggests a quasi-ethical, if also opposed criterion, holding that appreciation is “serious” so long as it engages with nature for the purposes of some kind of substantial exploration of the self, as opposed to “trivial amusement” (Hepburn 1993). In developing an account focused on imagination, Emily Brady appeals to the constraining ideal of “imagining well” (1998, 2003). Finally, Robert Stecker suggests a criterion of culpable error in belief: appreciating a whale in the belief that it is a fish counts as an aesthetic mistake, if I could reasonably be expected, as a member of my culture, to know that whales are mammals, not fish (2019).

Much of this debate concerning the normativity of nature appreciation parallels familiar discussions in the philosophy of art concerning the possibility of correctness and error in judgments of artistic value. For instance, Carlson’s claim that appreciators versed in natural history are best poised to appreciate nature echoes Hume’s famous claim that in evaluating art we should look to the verdicts of properly informed and qualified “ideal critics” (Hume 1757; see Carlson 1977). This view has been at the center of much recent discussion of art (see, e.g., Levinson 2002; Ross 2008; Lopes 2015). However, important aspects of the analogy between Hume’s ideal critics and the NEM’s ideal appreciators remain underexplored. For instance, Nick Riggle has recently questioned the Humean approach, suggesting that the “aesthetic ideal” may not be fully informed connoisseurship but rather the cultivation of a more personally invested relationship to art (Riggle 2015). An analogue of Riggle’s suggestion might also be applied to our “taste for nature” (Parsons 2023b). Should we aim to experience and appreciate the widest variety of environments, or should we instead cultivate our attachments to those select few places to which we feel some special, affective attachment? (on loving nature see Jamieson 2018)

2.2 The Aesthetics of Human Environments

As is clear from early collections of essays in environmental aesthetics (e.g., Kemal & Gaskell 1993; Carlson & Berleant 2004), the field initially concentrated on natural environments. However, discussion quickly extended to humanized and human-influenced environments (see von Bonsdorff & Haapala 1999; Berleant & Carlson 2007; Arntzen & Brady 2008). Here too the views of Carlson and Berleant were influential. From early on, Berleant applied his aesthetics of engagement to urban environments (Berleant 1978, 1984, 1986), later extending it to differing contexts such as rural countrysides, small towns, theme parks, gardens, and museums (1997, 2004, 2005, 2010b, 2012). Rejecting the common treatment of city aesthetics as mere visual amenity, Berleant instead portrays it as involving an intimate engagement producing a “mutual fashioning of person and place” (Berleant 1986). Subsequent researchers have drawn on Berleant’s ideas in exploring the experience of urban and other humanly shaped environments (see, e.g., Haapala 1998; von Bonsdorff 2002; Blanc 2013; Paetzold 2013; Łukaszewicz Alvarez 2017).

Carlson’s approach to the appreciation of human environments mirrors the NEM, with the difference that for human environments it is knowledge provided by the social sciences and history that is taken to be essential for appropriate appreciation (Carlson 2009). What is needed is to properly assess human artifacts such as buildings, cities, bridges, and farms is information about their histories, their functions, and their roles in our lives (Carlson 1985, 2001; Parsons & Carlson 2008). A related approach emphasizes the aesthetic potential of cultural traditions, which seem especially relevant to the appreciation of what might be termed cultural landscapes—environments that constitute important places in the cultures and histories of particular groups of people. What is often called a “sense of place”, together with ideas and images from folklore, mythology, and religion, frequently plays a significant role in individuals’ aesthetic experience of their own home landscapes (Saito 1985; Sepänmaa 1986 [1993]; Carlson 2000; Sandrisser 2007; Firth 2008; Nomikos 2018).

In these discussions, some specific types of humanized or “mixed” environments have emerged as the subject of particular interest: for example, the urban cityscape (von Bonsdorff 2002; Macauley 2007; Sepänmaa 2005, 2007; Parsons 2008; Erzen & Milani 2013; Frydryczak 2015) and specific elements within it (shopping centers, e.g.; see Brottman 2007). Industrial and post-industrial sites have also garnered attention. As cities ponder what to do with massive derelict sites such as Detroit’s defunct auto plants, citizens have come to see them as aesthetically interesting elements in the urban landscape, industrial “ruins” that evoke responses reminiscent of the Picturesque or the sublime (Maskit 2007; Kover 2014; Scarbrough 2018; Conroy 2019; Herrington & Lopes 2019).

Of all humanized environments, however, the one with the most profound resonance remains, perhaps, the garden. Biblical narratives around the “Garden of Eden” and the role of gardens in Islamic art offer familiar illustrations of the garden’s hold on the imagination. Another example is the ancient poetry of Theocritus and Virgil, which established the literary convention of the pastoral, in which shepherds loll in fruit-laden groves and sing love songs as they follow their flocks across a tamed, carefree landscape. Though the literary conventions of the pastoral had grown stale by the eighteenth century, its fantasy of escape from corrupt urban life into bucolic nature found new life in a passion for gardening and landscape design, fueled in part by the Picturesque (Ross 1998). Recent philosophical discussions have considered the meaning and aesthetics of contemporary gardening in general (Crawford 1983; Miller 1993; Cooper 2006; Salwa 2014, 2019; Parsons 2023b), as well as the nature of specific types of gardens, such as Japanese (Saito 1996; Carlson 1997; Heyd 2002; Brady, Brook, & Prior 2018; Chung 2018) and botanical gardens (Heyd 2006), and the relation of contemporary gardens to the Arts (Leddy 1988; Ross 2006). Philosophers have also discussed the related topics of the rural landscape and the agricultural environment, with an eye to the moral and environmental ramifications of the shift away from small-scale agriculture to industrialized farming (on the rural landscape see von Bonsdorff 2005; Andrews 2007; Benson 2008; Brook 2008; Leddy 2008; on agriculture see Carlson 1985; Schauman 1998; Brady 2006; Herguedas 2018).

Another contemporary type of humanized environment hearkens back to the heyday of Picturesque gardening: the sites of environmental artworks (Ross 1993, 1998). Large-scale artworks such as Michael Heizer’s Double Negative, Robert Smithson’s Spiral Jetty, and Christo’s Running Fence raise pertinent issues given that they are not only located in the environment, but include some portion of it as a constitutive part of the work. Adapting a term originally used by Smithson, Donald Crawford described such works as involving different forms of “dialectical relationship” between nature and culture (Crawford 1983). Some argue that there is an ethical problem with altering the environment in the way that environmental artworks do: Allen Carlson refers to such works as “aesthetic affronts” to nature (Carlson 1986, see also Humphrey 1985; Nannicelli 2018; Parsons 2023b) In response, others have defended the possibility of more ethical forms of environmental art, and explored its potential benefits for raising environmental awareness (Heyd 2002; Brady 2007; Brook 2007; J. Fisher 2007; Lintott 2007; Simus 2008b; Brady, Brook, & Prior 2018).

A similar array of aesthetic, ontological, and ethical issues are raised by restored environments. If a polluted wetland is restored to look (and perhaps function) much as it did before it was damaged by industry, is it thereby aesthetically equivalent to the original? Is the idea of nature restoration conceptually coherent, or does “restoring” nature simply turn it into an artifact? (Elliot 1997; Ross 2006; Katz 2012) Should restoration be guided purely by ecological concerns, or do aesthetic considerations also have a role? (Heyd 2002; Brady, Brook, & Prior 2018). A recent twist on restoration is the idea of “rewilding”: simply leaving an area free from future human intervention so that natural forces can reassert themselves, rather than actively engineering the environment to “restore” it to an original state. Prior and Brady (2017) argue that rewilded spaces present new aesthetic possibilities and challenges. This same theme emerges in recent suggestions that anthropogenic climate change is creating unprecedented and unpredictable types of “mixed environments” that may not fit the aesthetic concepts of the past (see section 4.6, below).

3. Aesthetics and Environmentalism

3.1 Aesthetic Protectionism

As mentioned above, environmental aesthetics connects in important ways with the concerns of environmental ethics. One such concern, obviously, is environmental protection from human intrusion and destruction. When development or exploitation of an environment could turn a benefit for humans, why should we refrain? Prudential reasons can sometimes be found, as when logging a watershed would threaten the water supply for humans. But when self-inflicted damage to ourselves or future generations is not reasonably likely, why should we opt to spare the environment from development?

Reflection on nature’s beauty prompts the intuitive idea of Aesthetic Protectionism: nature should be protected for, amongst other things perhaps, its aesthetic value (see Leopold 1966; Carlson 1976; Godlovitch 1989; Hargrove 1989; Rolston 2002; Hettinger 2008, 2010, 2017b; Robinson & Elliott 2011; Cheng 2017a). As mentioned above, this idea was a key motivation behind the National Park idea in North America and it continues to be an effective tool for environmental causes today. Protecting the magnificent polar bear from habitat loss is a powerful argument for restricting human development projects in the north, for example. Moreover, from a philosophical point of view, this idea allows one to ground nature protection, when merely prudential grounds will not suffice, on a familiar and uncontroversial kind of value—aesthetic value (Sober 1986). Despite its initial attractiveness, however, Aesthetic Protectionism faces some important complications and significant objections (Carlson 2010; Hettinger 2017b; Parsons 2023b; for a collection of relevant papers see Carlson & Lintott 2008).

One issue arises when this notion is used to ground the preservation of natural environments specifically, since in some contexts measures that preserve the beauty of an environment may arguably also render it something that is no longer natural (Godlovitch 1989; K. Lee 1995). A longstanding national park policy, for instance, was to protect park forests from the devastation of naturally occurring wildfire; in this case, one might question whether the beauty retained could quite be called “natural”. In other contexts, Aesthetic Protectionism may appear self-defeating for a different reason: for remote and ecologically fragile areas, focusing protection efforts around aesthetic considerations may actually put the area further at risk of degradation by attracting increased sight-seeing traffic (Parsons 2015b; Tenen 2020). Further, if aesthetic value is appraised through some version of the still-popular “scenic aesthetic”, the upshot of Aesthetic Protectionism is apt to be highly selective protection of those areas and species considered “nature’s masterpieces”: spectacular mountains and “charismatic megafauna” like the polar bear and panda. Less impressive specimens—wetlands, prairie, insects, and rodents—will be left out, even though their ecological significance may in fact be much greater (Saito 1998a, Rolston 2000, Callicott 2003; Hettinger 2010). A related concern is the way in which aesthetic considerations can provide an equally ready tool for those opposing environmentally beneficial policies, such as wind farming (Saito 2004; for further discussion of this case see Boone 2005, Gray 2012). Such concerns might lead one to the skeptical conclusion that aesthetic value actually conflicts with the aims of environmentalism or is, at best, too superficial to ground policies of action on matters of environmental protection (Loftis 2003; Stewart & Johnson 2018; for further discussion of the philosophical issues involved see Doran 2022).

A defender of Aesthetic Protectionism might respond that this last set of concerns ultimately stems from the scenic aesthetic, a view that should be rejected. Indeed, Hepburn and Carlson’s early critiques of the Picturesque have been echoed by many writers concerned with environmental protection, who have dismissed the scenic aesthetic as anthropocentric (Godlovitch 1994), scenery-obsessed (Saito 1998a; Gobster 1999), trivial (Callicott 1994), subjective (J. Thompson 1995), and/or morally vacuous (Andrews 1989). But even granting the case against the scenic aesthetic, it remains an open question how its replacement would fare with respect to the problems just cited. How widely will we find aesthetic value in nature? Will focusing protective efforts on aesthetics help or hinder environmental protection, from an ecological perspective? The most promising candidate on many of these scores would seem to be the NEM and its variants, given that these approaches take ecological understanding to be critically relevant to aesthetic appreciation. Nonetheless, some have questioned the extent to which even ecologically-informed approaches can successfully address these issues (Budd 2002; Hettinger 2005, 2008; Berleant 2010a, 2016; Bannon 2011; Stecker 2012; Herguedas 2018; Mikkonen 2018).

3.2 Positive Aesthetics

For some sympathetic to Aesthetic Protectionism, the idea of “positive aesthetics” has seemed to offer an attractive solution to some of its difficulties. This is the idea that every part of nature, properly seen, is beautiful (or alternatively, that there is no ugliness in nature). “Properly seen” here has often been understood to mean “seen in light of scientific understanding”, so that Positive Aesthetics has been viewed as closely connected to the NEM and related views. If correct, the implication of positive aesthetics would seem to be that no environment or species is, in principle, beyond the pale of aesthetic protection. However, the idea of positive aesthetics as stated above is vague, and working out a version that is precise, helpful in the case for aesthetic protection, and not subject to counterexamples has proven difficult.

A number of different approaches to articulating and defending the idea of positive aesthetics have been taken. Allen Carlson argues that because scientific understanding brings order, regularity, and pattern to natural phenomena, environments viewed in light of such understanding, as per the NEM, will appear aesthetically good (Carlson 1984a; see also Parsons 2002). Yuriko Saito argues that everything in a natural environment takes on aesthetic interest when made the focus of a story, whether scientific, cultural, or mythological, that illuminates and explains its origins (Saito 1998a). Another approach traces the lack of aesthetic failure in natural environments to the absence of normative functions in inorganic systems (Parsons 2004; Parsons & Carlson 2008; for discussion see Zangwill 2005a). Holmes Rolston offers a holistic explanation by way of the larger ecological role played by individual elements of an environment. Though a dead animal carcass or a forest burned by natural wildfire may appear ugly when considered in isolation, this ugliness is ameliorated once these elements are considered in their wider context (Rolston 1988; Hettinger 2017a).

Critics of positive aesthetics have offered a variety of objections to these views. Some find the idea problematic because it appears to undercut the possibility of the comparative assessments thought to be necessary for environmental planning and protection (J. Thompson 1995; Godlovitch 1998a; Newman, Varner, & Linquist 2017). Others have objected that the idea itself seems unintuitive, obscure, and/or inadequately justified (Godlovitch 1998b; Budd 2002; Alcaraz León 2010; Brady 2011; Stecker 2012). Even philosophers open to the idea of positive aesthetics have expressed reservations about some of its formulations, arguing that these depend too heavily on an out-dated conception of ecology and/or fail to stress an evolutionary understanding of nature (Simus 2008a; Paden, Harmon, & Milling 2012; Paden 2015a).

3.3 Aesthetics and Biodiversity

The idea of positive aesthetics is appealing as a way of addressing the worry that the scope of Aesthetic Protectionism will be too limited. Perhaps more fundamental than this concern however, is the worry that that much environmental protection today seems motivated not by any aesthetic considerations, but by the imperative to minimize biodiversity loss. That is, the habitats or species viewed as most in need of protection are those which are most rare or highly endangered. The desire to maximize biodiversity and the desire to maximize the amount of aesthetic value in the environment appear to be distinct motives, and indeed often pull us in different directions. If forced to choose between protecting a rare but visually offensive species from extinction and improving the prospects for a stunning but unimperiled one, the aesthetic protectionist will opt for the latter. But this is a decision many environmentalists would surely find troubling.

These environmentalists might prefer to eschew talk of aesthetic protection, and insist that preservation of biodiversity is, in its own right, a distinct reason for foregoing development. Of course, they then face the task of showing why this is a good reason. Again, prudential reasons for minimizing species loss may be available in particular situations, but an environmentalist might insist that biodiversity should be protected even when they are not.

Such a claim might be grounded by Aesthetic Protectionism, if one could argue that biodiversity and aesthetic value are conceptually connected. One suggestion for this latter approach appeals to a parallel with art: the rarer a type of artwork becomes, the greater its artistic value. As Sober puts it

A work of art may have enhanced value simply because there are very few other works by the same artist, or from the same historical period, or in the same style. (Sober 1986: 190)

A similar increase in the aesthetic value of individual organisms upon diminishment in their species’ numbers would mandate prioritizing endangered species, on purely aesthetic grounds (Russow 1981; for criticism of this approach see Godlovitch 1989; Davies 2012; Newman, Varner, & Linquist 2017; Welchman 2020).

A different approach is suggested by Jennifer Welchman, who argues that biodiversity is connected to aesthetic value in a more indirect way. Since aesthetic experience is a basic good, she argues, the state has an obligation to protect the means for obtaining it. Since a satisfying aesthetic life requires a rich and diverse array of things to appreciate, this obligation requires protecting the diverse array of natural environments and species that we possess. Thus broadly aesthetic considerations mandate the protection of biodiversity, just as they mandate the state’s preservation and promotion of wide array of different types of Art (Welchman 2018, 2020; for a critical response, see Linquist 2020).

Welchman’s analysis helpfully situates discussions of aesthetics and environmental protection in a broader political context. Such contexts, however, are often not as idealized as her argument suggests. As mentioned above, environmental legislation does sometimes make reference to aesthetic considerations, but often in ways that are far removed from theoretical considerations of basic goods and distributive justice. Levi Tenen has documented the important role played in US environmental protection by the “National Monuments” designation created in the 1906 Antiquities Act (Tenen 2023). Strictly speaking, declaring a forest or a mesa a “monument” makes little sense; moreover, it arbitrarily imposes, at least tacitly, an existing aesthetic framework (that relevant to memorial statuary) upon the natural entity being protected. Yet, for contingent historical reasons having to do with the balance of powers in the US government, monument designation emerged as an important way in which aesthetically motivated environmental protection unfolds in practice. Understanding the limits and possibilities of aesthetic protection will require further investigation of the legal institutions of environmental policy and the ways in which aesthetic values are embedded in them (see especially Richardson 2019; but also Saito 2007; Berleant 2010b, 2012; Sepänmaa 2010; Robinson & Elliott 2011).

4. Themes and Directions in Recent Work

In this concluding section we discuss six themes that represent new directions pursued in recent work in environmental aesthetics. Beyond those mentioned here, other issues include the social and quasi-institutional dimensions of environmental appreciation (Lopes 2020), the expressiveness of landscape (Wollheim 1991 [1993]; Howarth 1995; Pérez-Carreño 2021), the role of sound in environmental appreciation (J. Fisher 1998, 1999; Dyck 2016; Prior 2017), the connection between environmental aesthetics and feminist thought (W. Lee 2006; Lintott 2010), and the role of consumer aesthetics in causing environmental damage (Lintott 2006; Saito 2007, 2018; Maskit 2011; for an unvarnished historical overview, see Richardson 2019).

4.1 What is “Ecological Aesthetics”?

One long-standing theme in environmental aesthetics is the continuing effort to connect aesthetic experience with the central environmental notion of ecology. As noted above, the NEM has often been presented as developing the ecological perspective implicit in the thought of scientific figures such as Leopold and Muir. Beyond philosophy, a version of this idea, going under the name “ecological aesthetics”, has been defended in the fields of land management and landscape architecture (see Gobster 1995, 1999, 2013, 2008; Eaton 1997; Nassauer 1997b). “Ecological Aesthetics”, in this context, is characterized as

by definition, normative in that it asserts that it is desirable for humans to take aesthetic pleasure from landscapes that embody beneficial ecological functions. (Gobster et al. 2007: 962)

While this idea is obviously closed related to the NEM, the qualification “beneficial” introduces a subtle difference: appropriate appreciation of a landscape requires not only an understanding of its ecological operation, but also positive appraisal of its ecological value. On this view, the ecologically harmful—invasive species, for example—cannot be aesthetically good, regardless of their showy looks or interesting biology (for critical discussion see Parsons & Daniel 2002; on other recent discussions of the alignment of ecological and aesthetic value, see section 4.6 below)

More recently the label “ecological aesthetics” has also been adopted by some philosophers working in the so-called “Continental tradition” (Toadvine 2009). Drawing on figures such as Husserl, Heidegger, and Merleau-Ponty, this perspective overlaps in some ways with Berleant’s aesthetics of engagement, which in turn was influenced by ideas from Phenomenology (see Berleant 1985, 2013a). In this work, the label “ecological” is connected to the philosophical claim that organisms cannot be distinguished from their environment, except through an abstraction that distorts the ontologically primary reality of their embodied experience (for related Continentalist perspectives, see Tafalla 2011; Leddy 2012a; Maskit 2014; Seel 2015; Jóhannesdóttir 2016; Greaves 2019).

Still another interpretation of “ecological aesthetics” can be found in recent Chinese philosophy, where several writers have developed robust versions of “ecoaesthetics” (two prominent versions available in English translation are Cheng 2013a, 2016 and Zeng 2017). Cheng embraces, as his “four keystones of ecological aesthetic appreciation”, not only the centrality of ecological knowledge and the rejection of the duality of humanity and the natural world, but also the over-arching value of ecosystem biodiversity and health and the continued guidance of ecological ethics (Cheng 2013c). While the first of Cheng’s “keystones” is redolent of the NEM and the standard scientific understanding of ecology, the others invoke a more philosophical conception of “ecology” that has closer affinities to Berleant’s notion of engagement, the Continentalist ideas discussed above, and elements of traditional Chinese philosophy (Carlson 2017, 2018, Parsons & Zhang 2018; for further discussion of the relation between ecoaesthetics and Berleant’s view, see Berleant 2016, Cheng 2021).

4.2 Global Perspectives

Mention of the role of Chinese philosophy in Cheng’s ecoaesthetics points to a second theme: growing interest in a diversity of cultural perspectives. This trend follows recent calls for the globalization of aesthetics in general (Li & Cauvel 2006; Gandolfo & Worth 2015; Higgins 2017) and of environmental aesthetics in particular (Saito 2014; Liu & Carter 2014b). Some non-western perspectives have been considered in the Anglo-American literature: in addition to recent engagement with Chinese perspectives (Xue & Carlson 2010; Cheng et al. 2013; Liu & Carter 2014a; Chen 2007 [2015]; Brubaker 2018; Xue 2018), Japanese aesthetics has also been discussed (Saito 1985, 1992, 1996, 2002, 2014; Carlson 1997; Odin 2017; Callicott & McRae 2017; Chung 2018; Nguyen 2018). Also, within the “Western perspective” itself, some have considered the particular attitudes to landscape in specific regions or countries (Finland, for example: see Sepänmaa & Heikkilä-Palo 2005; Sepänmaa, Heikkilä-Palo, & Kaukio 2007).

A wider form of globalization, however, would look beyond the major global cultures (the Western and Chinese, e.g.) and their variants to the world’s many small scale “traditional” cultures. An understanding of this broader diversity in aesthetics need not be solely of anthropological interest. Nanda Jarosz, for instance, argues that philosophical theories in environmental aesthetics should consider not only scientific knowledge, but also the role of indigenous and local knowledge in aesthetic appreciation of the environment (Jarosz 2023). The challenge for such projects, however, is to connect the European/North American ideas of “the aesthetic”, which remain the touchstone of much contemporary philosophizing, to sets of ideas, values and practices from very different cultural contexts.

In many ways, the theoretical issues here parallel those in long-standing controversies about the “art” status of traditional artifacts from pre-industrial, tribal cultures (for an overview of this debate, see Dutton 2008 and Shiner 2008). In the context of the environment, however, different understandings of the “aesthetic” meaning and value of the land can have very real political and economic implications, such as the dispossession of land used by indigenous North Americans to facilitate the creation of parks where “nature”s beauty’ could be preserved and enjoyed (Cronon 1996; Spence 1999). Similar cross-cultural issues continue to play out across the so-called “developing world” (for recent discussions that bring out many of the relevant issues, see Saunders 2013; Maduka 2014; Vice 2023).

4.3 The Sublime and the Picturesque

Recent years have seen a reappraisal of the moribund notions of the picturesque and sublime. As described above, philosophers and historians have often castigated the Picturesque as the fountainhead of the problematic “scenic aesthetic”. Recently, however, some have highlighted more nuanced versions of the concept, such as that employed by the eighteenth-century thinker Uvedale Price (1796). Roger Paden argues that Price’s notion of the picturesque did not involve treating nature in a formalist or art-like fashion, and further emphasizes an important interrelation with the distinct aesthetic qualities of beauty and sublimity (Paden 2013; Paden, Harmon, & Milling 2013). Paden concludes that that suitably understood, the concept has an important role to play in the aesthetics of nature, providing the basis for a normative account of appreciation rooted in evolutionary biology (Paden 2015a, 2016; Paden, Harmon, & Milling 2012). In a similar vein, Isis Brook argues that the picturesque is particularly apt for appreciating gardens and the rural landscape, expressing “a love of wild nature in a small compass” (Brook 2008).

The notion of the sublime has also seen a rejuvenation. In seminal discussions, Guy Sircello (1993) and Ronald Hepburn (1988) asked why the sublime fell into desuetude, and suggested that, despite its neglect by philosophers, it might still have relevance to contemporary experience. Understanding of the former issue has been advanced by recent historical work on both the decline of sublime discourse in the context of modern tourism (e.g., Colley 2010) and its persistence in more extreme pursuits such as mountaineering (Macfarlane 2003; Hollis 2019).

The call for renewed philosophical attention to the sublime has been taken up by philosophers such as Emily Brady, who surveys early philosophical discussions of the concept and defends a broadly Kantian view of the sublime, on which it blends “aesthetic self-reflection with admiration that is externally directed” (Brady 2013: 118; for discussion see Mahoney 2016). Also reanalyzing the classical theories of the eighteenth-century, Sandra Shapshay attempts to reconcile the approaches of Kant and Edmund Burke in a “two-tiered” theory by distinguishing between a “thick” and “thin” sublime. The Burkean “thin sublime” is an unreflective, awe-like response whereas the thick involves reflection, a la Kant, on the challenge posed to our cognitive capacities by the sublime object (2013, 2019, 2021). Shapshay argues that this distinction allows an explanation of the cross-cultural occurrence of sublime experience, as well as its cultural variation and historical evolution.

Other writers have looked instead to contemporary psychology to frame new theories of the sublime and related emotions, such as awe. Arcangeli and Dokic, for example, analyze sublime experience in terms of “radical limit experience”, in which awareness of an insurmountable cognitive obstacle triggers a temporary feeling of self-negation (2021; see also Cochrane 2012; McShane 2018; Clewis 2019a). Despite their differences, these theories all characterize sublimity as a response to some form of cognitive failure. In contrast, Parsons (2023a) proposes a reinterpretation of the concept in terms of a form of cognitive success—a qualitative increase in perceptual ability which he calls “epistemic expansion”—arguing that so reconstrued, the sublime provides an apt vocabulary for certain aesthetic dimensions of contemporary experimental science.

4.4 The Aesthetics of Animals

A fourth area of recent interest is the aesthetic appreciation and value of non-human animals. (Hettinger 2010; Davies 2012) As mentioned in section 3.2 above, aesthetic considerations sometimes play a role in debates over the protection of species and their habitats. Empirical research confirms the intuitive thought that a species’ perceived attractiveness is an important factor in its garnering public support for protection (see, e.g., Landová et al. 2018; Richardson 2019). Cuteness, of course, constitutes one of the central elements of this perceived attractiveness (Lorenz 1950 [1971]; Morreall 1991; Sanders 1992).

From a more philosophical point of view, some have suggested alternative perspectives on animal beauty. One approach focuses on the sentient movement or “animation” of animals as their most aesthetically salient feature (for variations on this theme see Ruskin 1846; Rolston 1987; Vice 2017; Greaves 2019). Others argue that animals should be appreciated not merely for cuteness or animation, but in light of the biological and ecological function of their form and behavior (Parsons 2007; Parsons & Carlson 2008). This view holds that though many creatures have features that strike us as odd, sinister, or grotesque, an understanding of the adaptedness of their morphology and behavior to their particular environment reveals a satisfying aptness. Proponents also argue that such appreciation is more appropriate, from an ethical point of view, than the usual ranking of species according to their cuteness and possession of human-like qualities (for critical discussion see Davies 2010).

The functionalist approach to animal beauty suggests an argument for a form of Positive Aesthetics as applied to species, given that all species have form and behavior adapted to their particular environmental niche, for to find a species ugly might seem to require judging its form and behavior as deviant or unfitting (see Sibley 2001b). On the other hand, some insist that ugly species exist. Emily Brady argues that many species, such as toads and the Madagascan Aye-Aye lemur, qualify as ugly in virtue of possessing unappealing or disgusting features such as sliminess, being foul smelling, and being oddly proportioned (Brady 2014a). This issue turns, in part, on how the concept of ugliness is understood; on the traditional account of ugliness as involving deformity, the afore-mentioned qualities, though perhaps disgusting, would not constitute ugliness (Sibley 2001b; for discussion of ugliness, see Sauchelli 2014, Paris 2017).

Even admitting these as relevant to ugliness, Parsons (2023b) questions whether Brady’s particular counterexamples would refute the positive aesthetics claim, given that aesthetically positive features (the Aye-Aye’s adaptedness, the toad’s beguiling eyes, for example) also merit consideration. Setting aside this dispute about vertebrates, the most promising candidates for ugly species are surely to be found among those of our relatives that seem most alien to us: the insects. Here again, however, the key issue is how we should relate the instinctive (and presumably adaptive) fear and repulsion triggered by “creepy crawlies” to the notion of aesthetic appreciation.

Another phenomenon raising similar conceptual difficulties is animal predation. The relentless violence and bloodshed that characterizes animal existence in nature strikes many as profoundly ugly. Here, however, the “ugliness” appears to have an important moral dimension. What makes the cheetah’s killing and eating of a young impala ugly is that an innocent sentient being has been made to suffer pain and death, an event which seems clearly bad and a source of disvalue in the world. This analysis, however, raises deep questions about the cogency of applying moral categories to animal behavior. Given a lack of the kinds of reflective capacities humans possess, cheetahs cannot be considered moral agents or blamed for the act of killing their natural prey (see Carlson 2018). As such, it is unclear what aesthetic significance should be given to the apparent “ugliness” of natural animal behavior.

In response to this view, Hettinger argues that even if amoral, animal suffering caused by predation remains something bad, a form of disvalue that colors our aesthetic experience of the animal world. But he suggests that predation’s negative aspects must be considered alongside the essential evolutionary and ecological role it plays in the development of life on earth. Balancing these conflicting aspects of predation, he sees in it a kind of beauty, albeit a “a sad beauty, perhaps even a terrible one” (Hettinger 2010).

A final point of interest regarding the aesthetics of animals has been the multitude of specific ways in which people aesthetically encounter them, such as in the wild (Rolston 1987), in the “rewild” (Prior & Brady 2017), in scientific or quasi-scientific displays such as aquaria (Leddy 2012b; Semczyszyn 2013a), in zoos (Tafalla 2017; Parsons 2023b) and as parts of certain artworks (Cross 2018; Brady 2010).

4.5 Mediated Appreciation

Mention of animal appreciation in the context of aquaria and other sorts of quasi-scientific displays, such as museum dioramas, points toward a fifth theme: the possibility that environmental appreciation can occur through, or be mediated by, a representation (Semczyszyn 2013a, 2013b; see also Friday 1999). This is an intuitive idea, given the popularity and influence of artistic genres such as wildlife painting, wildlife and nature photography, and nature film. However, in line with the widespread critique of the Picturesque, the “landscape model”, and other art-centric approaches in environmental aesthetics, the idea of mediated nature appreciation has found little support in the literature. Semczyszyn and Friday, however, argue that mediated appreciation is not only valid, but an important dimension of our appreciation of nature and the environment (see also Brady & Prior 2020).

Recent writers have explored this general idea in relation to traditional media such as landscape painting (Paden 2015b; Matthes 2020), as well as nature photography and film (Parsons 2022; Hanich 2023; for a interesting auditory example see Matthes 2018). The latter furnish examples of ways in which new technologies have radically expanded the possibilities for aesthetic engagement with the natural world by providing new ways of seeing (Lopes 2003). High speed and time lapse cinematography, for instance, allow for the perception of events that unfold too rapidly or too slowly for humans to witness in unmediated experience, such as the strike of a chameleon’s tongue or the recession of a glacier. A more recent form of such “generative mediation” is digital astrophotography, a technology that allows for the visualization of faint celestial objects such as nebulae (on the aesthetics of astrophotography see Chadwick 2017, 2019; Parsons 2023a; see also Kessler 2012).

In addition to its intrinsic interest, the possibility of mediated appreciation relates to a wider debate, mentioned in section 2.1 above, regarding the role of art in the appreciation of nature and the environment. It also connects directly to debates about environmental protection, insofar as the ideal of “really experiencing” a location or animal (i.e., experiencing it in person, rather than through a photograph, painting, or film) is an important driver of tourist traffic that often generates environmental harm and, in some cases, can compromise the location itself (Parsons 2015b).

4.6 Climate Change and Aesthetics

A final theme in recent work is the growing interest in climate change and its current and future effects from an aesthetic point of view. As mentioned above, Di Paola and Ciccarelli (2022) argue that climate change has already created new and uncontrollable environments that constitute an unpredictable “mash up” of human and natural forces. Along with other writers, they have speculated on how these shifting environments may change our aesthetic experiences and responses. A key issue in these discussions is the significance of moral emotions prompted by the damaged environments of the Anthropocene: guilt, shame, sadness, and the like. Will such emotions color, perhaps even annihilate, the possibility of aesthetic value in these environments?

Some are pessimistic about our future encounters with the environment. Jukka Mikkonen, for example, argues that concepts once central to our appreciation of the environment, such as awe and wonder, will yield to a “new aesthetics of strangeness and uncertainty” (Mikkonen 2022, see also Auer 2019). Others see more room for optimism, arguing that, the “moral taint” of our damaged environments notwithstanding, there will remain the possibility for positive experiences of beauty and aesthetic value (Alcaraz León 2011; Brady 2014b, 2022; Ciccarelli 2014; Nomikos 2018; Fudge 2021).

The question of our future response to humanly damaged environments is not merely a question of psychology, but also a normative one (Parsons 2023b). Assuming it is possible to set aside the moral taint of the “Anthropocene world”, should we do so? The question echoes a familiar debate concerning the appreciation of “morally tainted” artworks (Gaut 2013). A traditional view holds that moral considerations are distinct from, and not relevant to, the aesthetic evaluations of an artwork. Others argue that setting aside a novel’s racism when evaluating its aesthetic value would be a kind of conceptual mistake. We may raise the analogous question: Would ignoring the moral taint of the degraded environments of the Anthropocene be a similar sort of error?

Some see here not only an aesthetic, but a moral error. One view, for instance, holds that finding beauty in the environmental damage brought about by our negligent practices represents a tacit approval and encouragement of those very practices (Foster 1992). An alternative position, in contrast, is that such appreciation is morally innocuous and may in fact make us more responsive to environmental issues (Alcaraz León 2011; Brady 2014b, 2022). This debate grapples with an issue—how our aesthetic attitudes might shape future treatment of our environment—that is as difficult as it is important, entangling us not only in philosophy but also with still unsettled matters of empirical psychology and environmental science. As is characteristic of the questions posed by environmental aesthetics, a shift from the familiar experience of art to our responses to the wider world around us at once complicates the theoretical issues and vastly raises the stakes.

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Other Internet Resources

• Semczyszyn, Nola, 2013b, “Visual Media in Environmental Aesthetics”, Unpublished Presentation to the 2013 Annual Meeting of the Canadian Society for Aesthetics, Victoria BC. [Semczyszyn 2013b available online].
• Carlson, Allen, “Environmental Aesthetics”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2024 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2024/entries/environmental-aesthetics/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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Acknowledgments

We are indebted to Sandra Shapshay, Ned Hettinger, and Levi Tenen for comments on an earlier draft, and to an anonymous reviewer for helpful suggestions.

The new version of this entry published in 2024 was almost entirely rewritten by Glenn Parsons. The author of the previous version, Allen Carlson, remains credited on this entry since a few passages have been retained from the previous version.