Ibn Kammūna

First published Tue Dec 18, 2007; substantive revision Fri Jul 19, 2024

The centuries following the remarkable achievement of Ibn Sina (Avicenna; d. 1037) were a remarkably creative period in the sciences and philosophy. Sa‘d ibn Mansur Ibn Kammūna, a Jew from Baghdad, actively participated in the lively discourse of his day. In his copious writings he takes up the entire gamut of philosophical issues discussed by his contemporaries. Editions, translations and studies of works by Ibn Kammūna and other thinkers of the time have appeared in recent years. Nonetheless, it remains difficult at this stage to contextualize Ibn Kammūna’s work satisfactorily, or to decide wherein lies his most noteworthy contribution.

No topic so engaged Ibn Kammūna more than the study of the human soul, especially its proper characterization and the proofs for its survival after the death of the body. So, after first surveying Ibn Kammūna’s biography, writings, and image, we will present Ibn Kammūna’s views on the soul and its afterlife. Then we shall follow the thread of one concept whose significance for the thought of the age has been firmly established, namely, ḥads [most usually translated as “intuition”], through his major writings. At the very least, this shall afford us a glimpse at the way Ibn Kammūna handles a key notion of psychology, epistemology, and the theory of prophecy, in various literary formats. Following that, we will present the first-ever survey of his religious ethics; the key texts have only recently been published. Finally, we will have a look at some of the sophistries and paradoxes that are attributed to him.

All agree that the publication of editions of Ibn Kammūna’s writings (all of which are in Arabic) are a necessary first step in the study of his contribution. There is far less agreement as to how to assess the worth of editions, as well as the need or lack thereof for redoing editions that are already available. Discussion of these and related issues are essential to our topic, and bear upon the proper understanding of Ibn Kammūna’s position on the issues of his day. With this in mind, we will end with a short, critical discussion of some editions that have appeared, just before the bibliography.

1. Life

Few facts of Ibn Kammūna’s biography are confirmed (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 8–22, for most biographical details and bibliography). He is presumed to have been born in Baghdad and to have spent most of his life there. However, there is good evidence that he spent some time in Aleppo; his presence in that important intellectual center explains certain facets of his activity that are otherwise difficult to account for (Langermann 2007). He may have been descended from a family of courtiers; he certainly had connections to some high officials, some of whom were his patrons. Ibn Kammūna also corresponded with some leading intellectuals, notably Nasir al-Din al-Tusi. Shortly before his death in 1284, Ibn Kammūna fled Baghdad for the nearby town of Hilla. This move has long been thought to have been forced upon Ibn Kammūna by hostile reaction to one of his books. However, it has recently been suggested that it is more likely to be connected to the execution of one of his patrons.

Ibn Kammūna was certainly born into a Jewish family. Though his writings as a rule do not betray his Judaism—if anything, they read like the work of a devout, if philosophically inclined, Muslim—his two forays into comparative religion exhibit a clear bias in favor of rabbinic Judaism. Some subtle polemics are detectable in glosses that he wrote to an important work of Islamic theology. (This is discussed in the next section.) On the other hand, his attraction to Sufi-style piety does not betray any influences of earlier Jewish ventures in the same direction, notably by the descendants of Maimonides. But did he remain Jewish until his death? There are counter-indications; one may take note of numerous pious references to the Prophet in Ibn Kammūna’s writings, not all of which can easily be ascribed to later scribes. The great bibliographer Moritz Steinschneider opined that Ibn Kammūna in fact converted; his arguments were countered by some of the great pioneers of Judaeo-Arabic studies, notably D.H. Baneth. Pourjavady & Schmidtke, in their recent book-length study (2006), doubt the story of Ibn Kammūna’s conversion. However, the most telling testimony in this regard is provided by Rashid al-Din Hamadani, who was of origin but certainly embraced Islam and castigated his predecessor Ibn Kammūna for not doing the same (Brack 2023, 17).

2. Writings

The latest studies on Ibn Kammūna have focused mainly on his psychology; his writings and doctrines in that field will be discussed below. Judging in terms of its impact on modern scholarship, especially when one moves beyond the rather narrow confines of specialists in late medieval Jewish and Islamic philosophy, as well its impact upon his own personal life, Ibn Kammūna’s Tanqīḥ (Examination of the Three Faiths, English translation by Perlmann) is his most important work. The fundamental premise of the treatise, and one that informs other of his writings as well, is that there is a single theory of prophecy that is accepted by Jews, Christians, and Muslims alike, and which, moreover, meets the truth standards of philosophy. What remains, then, is to compare the claims that are particular to each of the three faiths. Though the Examination should not be classified as a polemical work, as it contains no outright attack on any faith, its pro-Jewish bias is quite evident. Ibn Kammūna constructed the Jewish view he presents by means of a combination of ideas drawn from Maimonides and Judah Halevi. While this seems at first to be an odd mismatch of authorities, Ibn Kammūna was not the only Jewish thinker to harmonize the two eminent Andalusians. Christians and Muslims rejected the way their tenets were presented, and representatives of both penned rebuttals (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 106–113). On the other hand, no Jewish reaction of any sort to the Examination has reached us. It should be added that neither in the Examination, nor in any other work, does Ibn Kammūna make any unambiguous reference to Buddhism; given the political realities of Mongol rule (the Mongols had not yet converted to Islam) as well as Ibn Kammūna’s broad interests, one might have expected him to exhibit some curiosity.

Ibn Kammūna wrote a much shorter treatise on the differences between the two main Jewish groupings, Rabbinites and Karaites (English translation by Nemoy). Here again, despite the absence of any open polemics, it is clear that Ibn Kammūna’s sympathies lie with the Rabbinic majority.

Ibn Kammūna’s most significant contribution to the history of philosophy is his detailed commentary to Suhrawardī’s al-Talwīḥāt. (Several editions have appeared and are discussed in the last section of this entry). This is the first known commentary to that work, which, though more Aristotelian than other writings of Suhrawardī, still conveys essential points of the Ishraqi philosophy. Directly through his commentary, and indirectly by means of his influence upon Quṭb al-Dīn al-Shirazī (1236–1311), Ibn Kammūna was very instrumental in the initial phases of the exposition and diffusion of Suhrawardī’s thought.

Al-Jadīd fī ‘l-ḥikma (The New Wisdom); is a comprehensive exposition of thirteenth century science and philosophy. (For a preliminary study, see Langemann 2005; the titles of this book are discussed in the final sections below.) Numerous manuscript copies exist (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 87–92). Ibn Kammūna experimented with different formats and especially different lengths in his philosophical writing. He adhered to the traditional tri-partite classification of logic, physics, and metaphysics, in a lengthy format (al-Jadīd), a highly condensed version (Talkhīṣ; see Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 94, for bibliography, and an edition of the Arabic text, 196–206), and quite likely a middle length version (Risala fī ‘l-ḥikma), whose authenticity is still unresolved (Langermann 2005, 279–286).

Similarly, he has left us a medium length pietistic work (Kalimat wajiza) and a much shorter version of the same treatise (Ithbāt al-mabdaʾ); but he also confides that he may expand upon the Kalimāt wajīza (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 140). Even if that plan never came to fruition (no evidence of this longer version has as yet turned up), it indicates his conviction that important topics ought to be discussed in all three formats, which presumably take into consideration the varying abilities of people to devote time to study. The two extant pietistic texts are published (Arabic text only, with no discussion of the contents) by Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 139–195. Langermann (2017) has published an annotated translation of the Ithbāt as well as a book length translation and study of Kalimāt wajīza under the title Subtle Insights Concerning Knowledge and Practice (2019).

Ibn Kammūna wrote glosses to an important work of Islamic theology, Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī’s al-Ma‘ālim (Schmidtke & Pourjavady 2007). In part this is a supercommentary, that is, a response to an earlier set of glosses prepared by his contemporary, Najm al-Din al-Katibi al-Qazwini (d. 1277). In some places Ibn Kammūna defends al-Razi against the strictures of al-Katibī al-Qazwinī, but in others raises criticisms of his own against al-Rāzī. Some of the latter betray upon close reading a subtle anti-Islamic polemic. For example, his long gloss on the first query in chapter seven (Schmidtke & Pourjavady 2007, 96–98) is a critique of the role of miracles in establishing the prophetic mission. Ibn Kammūna names no prophets, concentrating instead on the precise definition of mu‘jiza (the Arabic term for miracle) given by al-Rāzī himself in other writings, which contradicts his definition in this particular work; and further arguing, again on theoretical grounds, that a tradition can be false (or at least contain some falsity) even if the transmitters are many. However, in the query under scrutiny, al-Rāzī is speaking specifically about Muhammad. Thus Ibn Kammūna’s critiques amount in effect to a rejection of the proofs for Muhammad’s prophetic mission. Later on, though, Ibn Kammūna makes specific criticisms of Judaism and Christianity (Schmidtke & Pourjavady 2007, 226). The glosses are written in a the highly technical language of Islamic theology, which is very different from the philosophical diction he uses in other writings. Ibn Kammūna has clearly mastered both idioms.

Several paradoxes are associated with Ibn Kammūna, and these continue to exercise Iranian thinkers down to the present. These are discussed in the final section of this entry. He has also left us some minor writings and correspondence; some pieces of a medical writings have also been recovered (see Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006 for bibliography; medical fragments published, translated, and analyzed in Langermann 2007, 14–19).

3. Evaluation and Image in Modern Scholarship

Ibn Kammūna’s work in psychology attracted the interest of the great pioneer in Islamic studies, Ignace Goldziher (1896), who devoted a short study to Ibn Kammūna’s arguments for the soul’s immortality. However, Ibn Kammūna’s main claim to fame in the twentieth century was certainly his Examination, which was widely hailed as the first dispassionate, scientific, non-polemical comparative study of its sort. Henri Corbin’s (1945) 2-volume work in French opened up the world of Suhrawardi and the Ishraqi philosophers for western scholarship, and signaled Ibn Kammūna’s key role in the diffusion of Suhrawardi’s thought. Nonetheless, we still have no clear picture of a distinctive Ibn Kammunian interpretation of Suhrawardi, if such a thing exists. His philosophy belongs to the elaboration, refinement, and defense of the Avicennian tradition, led in his day by Nasir al-Din al-Tusi, with whom he corresponded. On the other hand, he evidently accepted some of the criticisms leveled at Avicenna by Abu-l-Barakat al-Baghdadi and Fakhr al-Din al-Razi. Finally, the present article hopes to add to his intellectual portrait the deep piety evident in his ethical treatises, which draw upon Jewish, Islamic, and non-denominational philosophic sources.

4. The Science of the Soul

The science of the soul (‘ilm al-nafs) is an important topic in all of Ibn Kammūna’s philosophical treatises. In addition, he wrote three monographs, two of which aim to prove that the soul is eternal, and a third which refutes the claim that the soul is nothing but the temperament or mixture of the bodily humours, as well as the view that the soul comes into being along with the body. (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 100–106). His special interest in studying the soul (nafs) calls for explanation. Like so many other features of his work, it can be understood only in the context of the Avicennan legacy. Avicenna took his perception of his own self to be the most certain piece of knowledge that he possessed. (It may be noted in passing that in Arabic, nafs means both “soul” and “self”; though Avicenna took care to be as precise as possible in his terminology, this double-entendre has an inevitable presence in Arabic psychological literature, especially in the wake of Avicenna). This approach is totally at odds with the Aristotelianism that, in all of its flavors, was the foundation of Islamic philosophies. Throughout his life Avicenna struggled with the complex of problems ensuing from his insight, especially in the realms of psychology and epistemology, without ever arriving at a satisfactory solution. The conundrum reverberated in the work of the following generations.[1]

Ibn Kammūna took the Avicennan reformulation as his basic conception of the soul. In lengthier writings he would of course review the faculties, properties, and so forth associated with the soul; but the fundamental notion was that of the individual’s self-awareness. For example, in the introduction to his essay On the Immortality of the Soul, he writes “The (word) soul is a designation of the essence of the individual, to which one refers when one employs the pronoun ‘I’ in saying ‘I have done thus and so’, ‘I have reached such and such’” [trans. Nemoy 1958, p. 86]. In his pietistic Subtle Insights, Ibn Kammūna complains that a full discussion of the soul’s properties, mode of binding to the body, and so forth, would be “lengthy”; he is content to refer the reader to “books that have already appeared”. For his purposes, “the most important thing that has been mentioned about this and the most accessible to comprehension is what I am setting down in this flash (lamʻa). The first of these is to ascertain that the soul is that to which everyone points when saying ‘I apprehended such and such’ or ‘I did such and such’ ” (Langermann 2019, 73–74).

Nonetheless, Ibn Kammūna parted ways with Avicenna, and with the mainstream philosophical tradition, on the key issue of the soul’s pre-existence. Avicenna denied that the soul existed before the human was born, but Ibn Kammūna held that the soul’s pre-existence is intimately connected with its immateriality, and a doctrine that must be accepted in order to prove the soul’s survival after the death of the body. And, indeed, as Lukas Muehlethaler has shown in a series of publications, Ibn Kammūna labored to shore up the demonstrations of psychological doctrines throughout. In his commentary to Avicenna’s Ishārāt (“Pointers”), where the “Flying Man” thought experiment is displayed, Ibn Kammūna puts Avicenna’s verbal argument into syllogistic form. (Whether the syllogism is productive, and, in general, just how well Ibn Kammūna has succeeded in answering the modern critics of Avicenna, remain open questions; see Muhlethaler 2009 for full discussion). Ibn Kammūna boldly claims to have formulated the first demonstrative proof for the soul’s eternity a parte ante. Indeed, for Ibn Kammūna the soul is really an intellect (‘aql) that is called “soul” when it is associated with a particular body (Muehlethaler 2012).

5. Philosophy: Following the Thread of Intuition

5.1 Introduction

Ibn Kammūna looms as a philosophical writer, a learned and keen student, who bequeathed to posterity not a “philosophy” but rather a rich assortment of philosophical studies. Some, such as his New Wisdom, aimed at a synthesis; others, like his commentary to Suhrawardi, are primarily an essay in the interpretation of the thought of others; yet others, e.g., the monographs mentioned in the preceding section, address specific issues to whose resolution Ibn Kammūna feels he can contribute. Scholarship on his output, however, has displayed less interest in literary form, intended audience, and specific objectives; instead, in keeping with an academic tradition, it has focused by and large upon the identification of his “sources”, even at the level of sentence by sentence, or phrase by phrase, analysis. This approach has reaped some important insights, for example, the combination of Avicennan and Suhrawardian statements in connection with the notion of existence.

One drawback of this approach is the patchwork image it impresses upon the modern student, as if Ibn Kammūna set out to prepare a quiltwork of philosophical sources rather than to take a stand on the issues. But is this the way his writings present themselves to the reader who is innocent of academic scholarship? Ibn Kammūna is aware of the questions that are under debate, and as a rule he formulates a clear point of view. Nonetheless, his views may well have changed over the years—not at all surprising, if, as some think, he made the more traumatic act of switching religious affiliation. It is in any event clear enough that his expressions, emphases, agreements and disagreements, inclusions and exclusions, were in part functions of the literary genre which he chose for any given work. He could be critical in his commentaries, insofar as he would look closely at the text he was explicating and cite alternative views, but he would not reject outright the views of the author whose work he was commenting upon. In his original writings he was freer to take a personal stand.

If we also keep in mind the nascent state of scholarship on the man and the period in which he flourished, the best course of action for the present essay seems to be this. We shall take one very central concept, ḥads, most often translated “intuition”, and follow it through Ibn Kammūna’s major works. (It will become clear that in this context, intuition is a sui generis state, which, on the epistemological scale, falls between the discursive reasoning of very bright individuals and the gift of prophecy.) This will allow us to get a handle on a key feature of his philosophical thinking, as well as to observe the different ways the same concept is treated within the different projects that Ibn Kammūna undertook. Note that we shall be alert to the utilization of the concept, even if the term ḥads does not appear in the text under scrutiny.

Strictly speaking, ḥads is the revelation—some would add instantaneously—of the middle term of the syllogism, leading to an infallible conclusion. In practice, though, it had much wider application and less precise definition. Rare indeed is the case, when ḥads is cited as the source of knowledge, that the writer will display the full syllogism and specify the middle term (see Langermann 2005, 286–302, and Gutas 2001). In effect, it is of the same species as the “revelations” by which Avicenna learned of his own existence (and indeed the great bulk of his education) and, like that Avicennan moment, it shifted epistemology in the direction of a reliance upon a person’s sense of security in his personal illuminations . In the work of later thinkers, including Ibn Kammūna, the evaluation of ḥads served to legitimize alchemy and astrology and, more generally, to blur the distinction between demonstrative knowledge and revelation.

Ḥads was not just one more function to be added to the basket of terminologies used to explain psychological processes. Two applications in particular must be singled out. First of all, ḥads offered an analogy to prophecy; no other phenomenon from the world of humans, extraordinary as it may be, seemed as close to prophetic revelation. Second, it offered a way to account for great scientific acumen. Prophecy, scientific discovery, and intuition in general all lead those who experience them to certain knowledge in a moment of revelation, in general, knowledge that had not been available before.

5.2 Examination

Earlier attempts to explain the phenomenon of prophecy in terms of the then-accepted workings of the human psyche, for example, that of Maimonides, found analogous or proto-prophetic symptoms in two types of human inspiration. The first of these includes veridical dreams, divination, and other cases in which the unknown is revealed. The second comprises instances where people spontaneously perform acts of bravery, leadership, or literary creativity, and thus act in a manner that appears to be above the ordinary. These ideas were helpful in developing a political theory of prophecy; the prophet, like the philosopher-king, is a visionary, gifted with bold leadership as well as the ability to impose a code of behavior upon his people. The main difference is that the code of the prophet is expressly not of his own devise, but rather revealed by some supernal source. On the whole, Ibn Kammūna downplays the political function of prophecy. The prophet does have an important role to play in organizing and ordering society. However, the thrust of Ibn Kammūna’s analysis emphasizes the epistemological advantages of the prophet rather than his political skill. Moreover, as political leader, he is charged with inculcating correct religious belief; Ibn Kammūna sharply distinguishes between the prophet on the one hand, and rulers of jahiliyya (uncultured, lacking a proper revealed code) cities on the other.

The prophet’s distinction from others is to be explained in psychological terms by the perfection of his ḥads. In developing this theme, Ibn Kammūna makes the bold claim that ḥads is the ultimate basis of all human knowledge. All knowledge that is acquired is either a direct intuition, acquired by someone suitably equipped, or instruction in items of knowledge that has been acquired by someone else by intuition:

As for their [prophets’] perfection, it is due to the perfection of their speculative intellect, and for this reason. The middle term, by means of which one succeeds in acquiring intelligibles that were [hitherto] unknown, is at times obtained by means of ḥads, at others by means of instruction. However, ḥads is the basis of instruction. Things thus trace back without a doubt to intuitions which the masters [of intuition] arrived at. They then conveyed them to students. However, it is possible for someone to have an intuition on his own; the reasoning gels in his mind without a teacher. [Perlmann (ed.) 1971, p. 12; translation by the author]

Humans exhibit the full range of endowments, from the dull witted who never intuit, to those who are able to satisfy all or nearly all of their quests by means of intuition. The variation is seen both in the quantity of percepts that are obtained intuitively as well as in the speed of intuitive act. (Nonetheless, it should be added that Ibn Kammūna places the limit at “the quickest and shortest instant”; unlike Ibn Sina, for example, he does not claim here that intuition takes no time at all.) It is certainly possible that, at the upper bounds of human capacity, one may find an individual blessed with “an intense purity and an intense connection to the supernal sources” such that he can intuit all or most of what humans are capable of knowing, “not by means of an uncertain tradition, but by means of middle terms and demonstrative proofs.” Ḥads accounts not only for the quickness and independence of the prophet’s knowledge, but for its certainty as well. It meets the requirements of formal logic, since it supplies the middle term of the syllogism, and hence is demonstrative.

5.3 The New Wisdom

We examine first the theoretical discussions (following Langermann 2005, 286–302). In the chapter dealing with demonstration (burhan), Ibn Kammūna lists the seven types of judgment (hukm) by means of which one asserts or verifies (tasdiq) premises that are to be employed in a syllogism. Ḥadsiyyāt, intuitive judgments, are the last on the list, and Ibn Kammūna defines them simply as “what the soul judges to be certain on the basis of evidence (qara’in) other than that found in the [six] sources (mabadi’) that have been mentioned above” (al-Kabisi 1982, 196; author’s translation). Ibn Sina does not include ḥadsiyyāt in his classification of premises; Suhrawardī does include ḥadsiyyāt in two of his lists, but neither is identical to the one found in al-Jadīd. Despite all of these developments, however, Ibn Kammūna supplies here exactly the same time-worn example used by Ibn Sina (and before him by Aristotle), i.e., the fact that the moon’s light derives from the sun.

In a later section of The New Wisdom Ibn Kammūna reproduces almost word-for-word the final definition of ḥads given by Ibn Sina in his Pointers (al-Ishārāt), one of his later writings. He begins by noting that progress from first intelligibles to secondary ones can be either by means of fikr (cogitation or reflection) or by ḥads, “in that the middle term presents itself to the mind all at once, either as the result of a search and desire [shawq] for it, without any [corresponding] motion [of the soul], or without any impulse [ishtiyaq] or motion.” Ibn Kammūna continues, “Along with it, the object of the search [i.e. the conclusion of the syllogism] and that which it entails present themselves. There is no difference between reflection and intuition, other than the presence of motion in reflection and its absence in intuition” [ed. 441].

It is not difficult to find numerous examples of the application of ḥads in The New Wisdom; it has much harder to see how ḥads is to be integrated consistently into a comprehensive scientific program. Here follow some items of knowledge that are said to derive from ḥads. Ḥads indicates to astronomers, even where logical necessity does not, that the planets require more than one orb in order to complete their motions [ed. 402]. In the life sciences, we know by means of ḥads that irrational animals carry out their biological functions unconsciously [ed. 424]. As for metaphysics and psychology, we conclude by means of ḥads that intellect is more perfect than soul [ed. 517], and that bodies (or their species) are but shadows of spiritual entities [ed. 522]. Ḥads and repeated experience (tajriba) together indicate that the body is the only impediment to the soul’s conjunction with the pure forms [ed. 492].

The last example is particularly important because it illustrates the intimate connection between ḥads and tajriba, a connection maintained by Ibn Kammūna (and others) throughout. Tajriba is the most usual justification for the knowledge claimed by astrologers and alchemists. Hence both ḥads and tajriba aim to function as sources for hidden knowledge within scientific systems that are based upon (ultimately) Aristotelian logic. Although it is repeatedly invoked as the source for scientific knowledge, ḥads is not a tool of scientific inquiry, but rather a way of explaining, post facto, how a thinker hit upon the solution to a difficult problem. As such its function in science is very much the same as its function in explaining religious inspiration and prophecy.

5.4 Commentary to Suhrawardī, al-Talwīḥāt

The Ishraqi philosophy of which Shihab al-Din al-Suhrawardī (d. 1191) is considered the founder, has intuition as the basis of its epistemology, at least in theory.[2] Illumination (ishraq in Arabic), in a word, describes the event, which many speakers of English would also call intuition, which yields knowledge swiftly and certainly. Intuition plays a major role in al-Talwīḥāt, which is considered to be one of Suhrawardi’s more peripatetic writings. It is not surprising, then, that Ibn Kammūna frequently mentions intuition in his commentary to al-Talwīḥāt. It should be borne in mind, though, that true to his role as commentator, Ibn Kammūna will as a rule try to flesh out and expand upon Suhrawardi’s intentions, rather than expressly developing his own ideas.

We shall limit ourselves here to a few examples drawn from the partial edition of this commentary published by H. Ziai and A. Alwishah, which covers part two of al-Talwīhāt and whose subject is natural science or physics. Ibn Kammūna in one place quotes approvingly Suhrawardi’s account of how greatly people differ in this respect: “People differ with regard to ḥads. There are the doltish, who have never had any success in thinking; and there are those with powerful ḥads. Many of the latter exceed others in quantity and quality; but there is no limit, at which one must perforce stop. It is possible for there to be someone who perceives by means of ḥads most of the intelligibles in a short time and without a teacher; and there is a [type of] soul called ‘holy’ whose capacity is as powerful as that of the prophets” (Ziai & Alwishah 2003, 456).

Other passages afford us an opportunity to sample how ḥads is employed in various scientific, or, as we would judge today, occult contexts. In laying forth an account of some twelve phenomena, including various optical effects in the atmosphere, thunder, lightning, and comets, all of which are produced by “vapors” originating in the earth (much as Aristotle had argued in his Meteorology), Ibn Kammūna adds that, conjoined to those causes, ḥads judges that there must be “spiritual forces” that are due to celestial configurations (Ziai & Alwishah 2003, 254). Animals other than man have a rational soul; this ties in to the question of metemsomatosis. The reasoning will be evident to someone who employs ḥads, but not to someone who either willfully shuts off ḥads, or was simply not born with that gift (Ziai & Alwishah 2003, 346–7).

5.5 Key Issues in the Science of Wisdom (al-Maṭālib al-Muhimma fī ‘ilm al-ḥikma)

This treatise is concise in length but encyclopedic in character. (See the edition by Musawi 2003; see also Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 92–3.) It is divided into seven sections. Here as always logic is the first topic to be discussed, but ḥads is not mentioned at all in the section on logic. It does however figure in the seventh and final section, which deals with psychology. In line with some trends of the time, Ibn Kammūna here ranks “the science of the soul” as the most sublime of the sciences, because the human soul is analogous to the deity.

The fifth “query” of the final section focuses upon the cognitive capacities of the human soul. These vary from person to person, just as bodily endowments vary. However, at the high end of the spectrum, there exists a human soul whose cognitive ability is for all practical purposes unlimited. At this level, human cognition is a “taste” of the divine. Ibn Kammūna explains:

Only someone who has experienced (literally “tasted”) the true reality of the divine fragrances can represent these things to himself. But from among the souls that do not attain this by means of their innate disposition, some do [manage to] acquire it, whereas others are not able to acquire anything at all. Whosoever abandons bodily excesses, makes the best of necessities, and keeps away from people [by living] in mountaintops and empty spaces, thinking about the fine points of divine wisdom, intensely and purely devoted to Him, and at times singing about this in well-known harmonious melodies, with poetic speech, about the greatness of God Most High—he will receive some of the divine pleasures, such that are impossible to describe, and speech is too restricted to express; that is, if he is endowed to accept this path. All of this is known through experience to the person who finds it within himself, and by recurrence along with intuition to the one who is endowed (Musawi 2003, p. 85 translation by the author).

Here as elsewhere, ḥads is paired to tajriba (“experience”) and is described as an innate gift. Here, however, Ibn Kammūna adds adds an important point. Those who did not receive the gift of ḥads at birth can get a taste of the divine if they cultivate the Sufi methods of isolation, mediation, music and prayer.

5.6 Pietistic writings (Kalimāt wajīza, Ithbāt al-mabda’)

The Arabic originals of these two intimately related treatises were published for the first time by Pourjavady & Schmidtke (2006); an annotated translation of the Ithbat was published by Langermann (2017). In these writings, Ibn Kammūna pays far less attention to questions of cognition than he does in his other writings. However, here as elsewhere, he takes note of the abilities of gifted people to grasp issues that remain recalcitrant to others who are not so endowed. Here again Ibn Kammūna connects this special mode of cognition with tajriba, repeated experience. In addition, he emphasizes here that the fruits of this special type of knowledge can be fully appreciated only by someone who has experienced them. It is thus striking that he does not employ the technical term ḥads in the course of his exposition, or, indeed, anywhere at all in these two writings.

Consider this passage from the Subtle Insights (Langermann 2019, 83-84): “When the weakness of the bodily impediment combines with the strength of the soul, whether this [strength] be inborn, or it is acquired, the way that the soul is strengthened by training (tabdrīb), or the exercise (riyāḍa) ascribed to the [Sufi] gnostics--then the contact may be so fortified that the soul obtains many hidden things,venerable items of knowledge and illuminating pleasures, whose true nature (kunh) is perceived by a person only on his own”. A few lines down tajriba is mentioned: “Many strange things about the soul are known by repeated experiences (tajārib), their recurrence, and some form of reasoning (qiyas).”

Tajriba does appear in the passage just cited, but it is not mentioned at all in the shorter pietistic treatise, Ithbāt al-mabdaʾ (Establishing the First Principle). On the other hand, Ibn Kammūna does employ in the shorter work several cognate terms to describe the person who can grasp a certain fact immediately and without the need for lengthy demonstration: dhihn salim (“healthy mind,” Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 188), dhu fitana (“clever,” Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 189), dhu lubb (“understanding,” Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 189).

The terminological conundrum intensifies when we bring into the discussion another term, dhawq, literally “taste”. Dhawq is a Sufi term and refers to a usually fleeting, intense religious experience, which leaves the adept knowing something more than he knew beforehand. Viewed as a phenomenon of the human mind, it is essentially the same thing as intuition. It is used in exactly this sense by Ibn Sīnā—significantly, in the monograph on the rational soul considered to be his very last work.[3] Suhrawardī adopted the term for his version of knowledge based upon intuition, ḥikma dhawqiyya; in Ibn Kammūna’s New Wisdom, ḥads and dhawq are synonymous (Langermann 2005, 300). Yet in the pietistic writings, where one would expect to find the usual Sufi term, dhawq is not employed.

There is little difference between the ideas expressed in these two treatises and those in the other writings. In all cases the basic thought is that some people are born with an innate ability to swiftly arrive at conclusions that are certainly true. There remains the technical distinction, in that ḥads, and ḥads specifically, is said to disclose the middle term of the syllogism. However, one should not make too much of this. For one matter, even in cases where ḥads is invoked, we rarely if ever can determine just what the syllogism is for which ḥads has revealed the middle term. One important exception is the reasoning that leads to the momentous conclusions drawn from the “Flying Man” experiment (see Muehlethaler 2009). Moreover, whether or not ḥads is specifically mentioned, intuition or spontaneous comprehension is paired to tajriba.

The chronology of Ibn Kammūna’s writings will not solve the problem either. Subtle Insights seems to have been written well after Ibn Kammūna had already been exposed to the writings of Ibn Sina and Suhrawardi, both of whom make much of ḥads, as we have seen (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 8–12). We are thus confronted here with the historiographical and methodological question of the weight to be given to technical terms as opposed to ideas, a question that the present writer opts to leave open.

6. Piety and Ethics

Ibn Kammūna’s writings as a rule deal exclusively with speculative matters. Two recently published treatises, however, give equal weight to praxis, in line with the pairing of ‘ilm and ’amal (knowledge and practice) that appears in the title of the longer work; this pairing was widespread among Sufis but by no means limited to them alone. Ibn Kammūna usually identifies the reader of these tracts as an ‘āqil, literally someone who employs his intellect; this too is quite common. Other expressions he uses to describe his audience are “seeker of perfection” and “seeker of salvation (najat) and perfection.”

The speculative philosophy expressed in these writings is in keeping with the views that Ibn Kammūna expresses elsewhere. However, he has in mind here a very particular type of ‘ilm; “true” ‘ilm is not, as he tells us, what people generally think. Rather, it is self-knowledge: knowledge of one’s own shortcomings, and of one’s obligations to worship God. Knowledge of this sort is goal directed; it serves to weaken one’s connections or involvement in this world, and to produce a concomitant intensification of one’s inclination towards the other world. The sections on ’amal, which urge an ethical program steeped in piety, reveal a side to Ibn Kammūna that has not been mentioned, let alone adequately explored, in the scholarly literature to date. The following paragraphs are an attempt to bring to the fore some salient points. We shall offer some suggestions towards contextualization, which are necessarily tentative and preliminary.

The tension-free concord between reasoned, independently verifiable knowledge and knowledge based on revelation and tradition (science and faith, to put it more simply) manifest in these writings is noteworthy. Ibn Kammūna raises none of the ostensible contradictions that so troubled Ibn Sina, al-Ghazali, and Maimonides. A series of generally facile arguments are given for the existence of God and his attributes. In general, the conception of the deity is informed more by His goodness and bounty than it is by His power and judgment.

Consistent with the concerns so prominent in his other writings, Ibn Kammūna devotes a great deal of space (half of part one of Subtle Insights, which deals with ‘ilm, whose meaning in this text has been described two paragraphs above) to the human soul (nafs; the meaning of this term in this text has been given above, section II), its quasi-divine nature, and its survival after death. His discourse on these issues is philosophical. In the second part of this treatise, however, Ibn Kammūna shifts to a Sufi mode of exposition. In keeping with Sufi notions, he emphasizes the key, critical role of the qalb, literally “heart”, as the epicenter of human goodness. However, he does not adopt the very common Sufi opposition of nafs, “soul”, to qalb, where the former stands for passions and bad moral traits. Instead, he defines qalb as “the eye of nafs. (”Eye“ in this context has much the same meaning as it has in the English phrase, ”the eye of the storm“).”

Both treatises display a thorough integration of religious as well as [the masters of] philosophical ideas and ideals. As Ibn Kammūna writes at the beginning of Subtle Insights: “The masters of traditional religions and of intellectual tenets agree that salvation and eternal felicity depend upon belief in God, [belief in] the end of days, and doing good works” (Langermann 2019, 36). Elsewhere Ibn Kammūna speaks of “the people of wisdom and revelation.” The values and ideas expounded in these two works look to represent a consensus that has been reached by these two groups, who, in different circumstances, were thought to be very much at odds with one another. We cannot say as yet how widespread this concordance was as a social phenomenon. In any event, it was shattered a century later by Ibn Taymiyya and his followers, who assaulted the “foreign” sciences from different angles.

’Amal is definitely subordinate to ‘ilm; in this sense, the pietistic treatises continue the strong scientific orientation evident in all of Ibn Kammūna’s writings. However, praxis is by no means a concession to the low intellectual level of the masses, as it is often thought to be in “political” conceptions of religion; nor is it merely a device to restrain bodily drives. Praxis and science reinforce each other in a specific way: “Sometimes the postures of the [bodily] limbs lift lights into the heart, just as lights from the items of knowledge of the heart go down to the limbs. This is the secret of the exaltation of the souls by means of bodily forms of worship” (Langermann 2019, 110). There is thus a distinct and immediate spiritual reward for praxis, even for—perhaps especially for—the enlightened.

Subtle Insights is dedicated to a Muslim patron, and it easily and naturally reads as a work of Muslim piety. However, on close inspection, there is nothing distinctly Muslim about it. Ibn Kammūna is driven by the same idea of spirituality and religiosity common to Muslims, Jews, Christians, or non-denominational philosophic theists of the type described by Judah Halevi in his Kuzari, a book that Ibn Kammūna studied closely. It is striking that the only Qur’anic verse cited, from the fifty-seventh sura (“Iron”, verse 3) has, at least for its first part (“He is the first and the last…”), an exact parallel in both the Hebrew and Christian bibles.

Just how much Jewish ethics, biblical, rabbinic, and medieval, Ibn Kammūna has included is difficult to determine. Jewish and Islamic ethics have been intertwined all along; by the thirteenth century, some rabbinic ideas had become thoroughly islamicized on the one hand, and, on the other, Jewish versions of Sufism were well-established. Jews cited snippets of the Qur’an as apothegms of universal wisdom, rather than as the scripture of a particular faith community.[4] So when Ibn Kammūna says that “The beginning (ra’s, cf. Hebrew reishit) of wisdom is fear of God,” is he consciously importing the verse from Psalms 111:10? Overall, Ibn Kammūna appears to have formulated an original “Abrahamic” philosophical piety. Both the philosophical foundations underpinnings (concepts of the deity and of humanity) as well as the moral values and spiritual exercises, were carefully crafted so as to be acceptable to all monotheists .

7. Shubahāt: Paradoxes, Problems, and Sophistries

A number of “problems” (shubuhāt; the Arabic refers to all forms of obscurities, including what we call paradoxes and sophistries) are attributed to Ibn Kammūna. These have challenged Iranian philosophers in particular from the sixteenth century onwards (Pourjavady & Schmidtke 2006, 37–51). Some but not all can be traced to known writings of Ibn Kammūna. One of these is the famous liar paradox, which Ibn Kammūna discusses in The New Wisdom; some later figures mistakenly thought that Ibn Kammūna had invented it. Another, much discussed item is “the problem of unity” (shubhat al-tawḥīd). Especially since Ibn Sina, the deity was widely identified with wājib al-wujūd, “that whose existence is necessary”; but, as a philosophical category, is “necessary existence” necessarily unique? Muslim and Jewish thinkers would certainly want it to be so, but proving this point was no simple matter. At one place Ibn Kammūna argues from the interconnectedness of all reality, which implies that a single “necessary existence” must stand at the top of the causal chain. He may have picked this up from Maimonides who noted in his Guide of the Perplexed (Part I, Ch. 72) that the unity of reality is an important indication for the unity of God. Elsewhere, however, he chose a more torturous route. Were there more than one “necessary existence”, then, rather than being a unique essential characteristic, “necessary existence” would perforce be demoted to the rank of an accident shared by two or more beings. It was this proposal that was debated and criticized by later thinkers.

Another “problem” is a sophistry that ties in with some recondite issues in logic that exercised Ibn Kammūna and his contemporaries, especially conversion by contraposition (Langermann 2007, 11–13). It appears that Ibn Kammūna tried to manipulate the simple observation that creation (ḥudūth al-‘alam) is not counterfactual, that is to say, it does not require one to deny immediate reality (al-waqi’, reality or actuality as it presents itself here and now), into a formal proof: creation does not necessitate the denial of immediate reality; whatever does not necessitate the denial of immediate reality is immediately real; ergo, the creation of the world is immediately real.

Ibn Kammūna communicated this “proof” to Nasir al-Din al-Tusi, who proceeded to uncover its fallacies.[5] For example, the contraposed major premise, “whatever does not necessitate the denial of immediate reality is immediately real,” when written in its positive formulation, requires a rider: “Whatever is absent from immediate reality (ghayr waqi’, grammatically a positive sentence in Arabic) necessitates the negation of immediate reality, as long as it remains absent from immediate reality.” The rider, however, makes the premise hypothetical, and that, in turn, changes the rules as far as conversion is concerned, and does not allow the conclusion Ibn Kammūna wishes to draw.

8. Recent Editions

It is a common complaint in the field of Islamic philosophy, especially in its post-Avicennan phases, that we lack editions of primary texts; this complaint was voiced in the first version of this entry. In the intervening years, not a few editions of writings by Ibn Kammūna have appeared. Two key texts have been reissued in the original. Dr Lwiis Saliba has reissued the Tanqīḥ al-Abḥāth (Examination the Three Faiths, published by Byblion, in Byblos, Lebanon 2009; a second printing was made already in 2010) in a volume of nearly 600 pages, provided with a detailed introduction and copious notes, all in Arabic, but with a very good command of academic publications in European languages. Simon Bellahsen has published a French translation of the Examination, including a translation of portions from the biography in Pourjavady and Schmidtke 2006: Examen de la critique des trois religions monothéistes, Paris: Vrin, 2012. H.J. Isfahani published a new edition of the New Wisdom, which he chose to give an alternative title, Kitāb al-Kāshif (The Revealor), published jointly by the Iranian Institute of Philosophy and the Institute of Islamic Studies of the Free University of Berlin, Tehran 2008.

Only a very small portion of the commentary to Suhrawardi’s Talwihat was published by Ziai and Alwishah. Now two editions of the full text have been prepared: a three volume doctoral dissertation by Sayyid H.S. Musawi (Tehran University, 1385 Solar, 1996/1997) and a three volume publication by N. Habibi (Tehran 1387 Solar, 2008/2009.) Joep Lameer scoured all three editions and published a thirty page review (2012). He concludes that we are still in need of a reliable edition.

These are welcome developments, to be sure, but there is cause for further reflection. In particular, the arguments advanced by Ibn Kammūna have as a rule not been taken into account by the editors, who must decide between variants in the manuscripts, or by the critics who review the editions. Simply taking note of variants missed by one or more editor, even if these seem to be significant, is not enough; we would like to see a discussion of sample passages, with full analysis of the implications of the different readings. At times there is no grammatical, syntactical, or lexical reason a priori to choose one variant over the other. Without fully understanding the passage in question, errors may ensue; an example of this given by Langermann 2009, p. 282. Earlier editions must not be dismissed as worthless unless one can provide examples to prove such an extreme claim. Moreover, changing the title of a book in mid-course without any justification (all agree, for example, that Ibn Kammūna himself gave no title to the work commonly referred to as the New Wisdom) introduces confusion with no compensatory payoff.

Finally, the second Gulf War and its severe impact on the Iraqi cultural heritage have produced some positive developments in the study of Ibn Kammūna. Most notably, the efforts at recataloguing the collections of Iraqi institutions have brought to light a great deal of valuable information about still extant manuscripts of the writings of Ibn Kammūna and their contents, most notably in in the Maktabat al-Rawḍa al-Ḥaydariyya at Najaf. Sabine Schmidtke (2022) has reported in detail on items related to Ibn Kammūna. As of this writing (June 2024) images of these texts are not available for research. However, and not surprisingly, some items have found their way to the public auction block, and Schimdke has secured images of one related to Ibn Kammūna and his engagement with the logic of al-Nakhjuwani (see above). These are reproduced at the end of the paper cited in the preceding sentence.

Bibliography

Note: We cite here the most important works, mainly in English. Pourjavady & Schmidtke has a very extensive bibliography. Additional materials are found in the preceding section (Recent Editions) as well as the internet resources listed in the following section.

  • Alwishah, Ahemd, 2017, “Suhrawardi and Ibn Kammuna on the Impossibility of Having Two Necessary Existents,” in Illuminationst Texts and Textual Studies: Essays in Memory of Hossein Ziai, Ali Gheissari, John Walbridge, and Ahmed Alwishah (eds.), Leiden: Brill, 115–134.
  • al-Kabisi, H.A. (ed.), 1982, al-Jadid fi al-hikma, Baghdad: University of Baghdad.
  • Black, D.L., 1982, “Avicenna on Self-Awareness and Knowing that One Knows,” in The Unity of Science in the Arabic Tradition, Shahid Rahman, Tony Street, and Hassan Tahiri (eds.), AK Houten: Springer, 2008, pp. 63–87.
  • Brack, Jonathan Z., 2023, An afterlife for the Khan: Muslims, Buddhists, and sacred kingship in Mongol Iran and Eurasia, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Corbin, H. (ed.), 1945, Shihāb al-Dīn al-Suhrawardī: Opera Metaphysica et Mystica, 2 volumes, Istanbul: Maarif Matbaasi.
  • Eichner, H., 2009, “The Chapter ‘On Existence and Non-Existence’ of Ibn Kammuna’s al-Jadid fi l-Hikma: Trends and Sources in Author’s Shaping the Exegetical Tradition of al-Suhrawardi’s Ontology,” in in Avicenna and his Legacy, Y. T. Langermann (ed.), Turnhout:Brepols, 143–177.
  • Goldziher, I., 1896, “Sa‘d b. Mansur ibn Kammuna’s Abhandlung uber die Unverganglichkeit der Seele,” in Festschrift zum achstigsten Geburtstage Moritz Steinschneider, Leipzig: O. Harrassowitz, 110–114.
  • Gutas, D., 2001, “Intuition and Thinking: The Evolving Structure of Avicenna’s Epistemology,” in Princeton Papers: Interdisciplinary Journal of Middle Eastern Studies, 9: 1–38. [This is a special issue: Aspects of Avicenna, Andras Hamori and Bernard Lewis (eds.).]
  • Gutas, D., 1988, Avicenna and the Aristotelian Tradition, Leiden: Brill.
  • Lameer, J., 2012, “Ibn Kammuna’s Commentary on Suhrawardi’s Talwihat: Three Editions,” Journal of Islamic Manuscripts 3:154–184.
  • Langermann, Y. Tzvi, 2003, “Saving the Soul by Knowing the Soul: A Medieval Yemeni Interpretation of Song of Songs,” Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy, 12: 147–166.
  • –––, 2005, “Ibn Kammūna and the New Wisdom of the Thirteenth Century,” Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 15: 277–327.
  • –––, 2007, “Ibn Kammūna at Aleppo,” Journal of the Royal Asiatic Society (Third Series), 17: 1–19.
  • –––, 2009, Review of Pourjavady and Schmidtke 2006, in Review of Middles Eastern Studies, 43(2): 280–282.
  • –––, 2017, “Ithbāt al-Mabda’ by Saʿd ibn Manṣūr ibn Kammūna: A Philosophically Oriented Monotheistic Ethic”, in Illuminationst Texts and Textual Studies: Essays in Memory of Hossein Ziai Ali Gheissari, John Walbridge, and Ahmed Alwishah (eds.), Leiden: Brill, 135–159.
  • –––, 2019, Subtle Insights Concerning Knowledge and Practice, New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Marcotte, Roxanne, 1996, “Philosophical Reason vs. Mystical Intuition, Shihab al-Din Suhrawardi (d. 1191),” Anaquel des Estudios Árabes, 7: 109–125.
  • Muehlethaler, L., 2009, “Ibn Kammuna on the argument of the Flying Man in Avicenna’s Isharat and Suhrawardi’s Talwihat, in Avicenna and his Legacy”, Y. T. Langermann (ed.), Turnhout:Brepols, 179–203.
  • –––, 2010, Ibn Kammuna (D. 683/1284) On the Eternity of the Human Soul. The Three Treatises on the Soul and Related Text, Ph.D. Dissertation, Yale.
  • –––, 2012, Revising Avicenna’s Ontology of the Soul: Ibn Kammuna on the Soul’s Eternity a Parte Ante, The Muslim World, 102:597–616.
  • Musawi, S.H.S. (ed.), 2003, Key Issues in the Science of Wisdom, in Kheradname-ye Sadra, 8: 64–86.
  • Nemoy, L., 1958, “Ibn Kammuna’s Treatise on the Immortality of the Soul,” in Ignace Goldziher Memorial Volume (Volume 2), S. Loewinger, A. Scheiber, and J. Somogyi (eds.), Budapest: Typ Globus, 83–99.
  • –––, 1972–3, “Ibn Kammunah’s Treatise on the Differences between the Rabbanites and the Karaites,” Jewish Quarterly Review, 13: 97–135, 222–246.
  • Perlmann, Moshe (ed.), 1971, Ibn Kammūna’s Examination of the Three Faiths. A Thirteenth Century Essay in Comparative Study of Religion, Berkeley-Los Angeles: University of California.
  • Pines, Shlomo, 1979–1989, The Collected Works of Shlomo Pines, 2 volumes, Jerusalem: The Hebrew University Magnes Press.
  • Pourjavady, R., and Schmidtke, S., 2006, A Jewish Philosopher of Baghdad. ‘Izz al-Dawla Ibn Kammuna (d. 683/1284) and His Writings, Leiden and Boston: E.J. Brill.
  • Schimmel, Annemarie, 1975, Mystical Dimensions of Islam, Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina.
  • Schmidtke, Sabine, 2022, “Saʿd b. Manṣūr Ibn Kammūna’s Writings and Transcriptions in the Maktabat al-Rawḍa al-Ḥaydariyya, Najaf: Preservation, Loss, and Recovery of the Philosophical Heritage of Muslims and Jews,” Intellectual History of the Islamicate World, 10(3): 278–325.
  • Schmidtke, S., and Pourjavady, R., 2007, Critical Remarks by Najm al-Din al-Katibi on the Kitab al-Ma‘alim by Fakhr al-Din al-Razi, together with the Commentaries by ‘Izz al-Dawla Ibn Kammuna, Tehran:Iranian Institute of Philosophy & Institute of Islamic Studies, Free University of Berlin.
  • Ziai, H, 1991, Knowledge and Illumination, Atlanta: Scholars’ Press.
  • Ziai, H., and Alwishah, A., 2003, Ibn Kammūna: al-Tanqīhāt fī Sharh al-Talwīhāt, Costa Mesa: Mazda.

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Much of the research for this entry was carried out during tenure of a grant from the German Israel Foundation for Scientific Development.

Copyright © 2024 by
Tzvi Langermann

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