Nietzsche’s Moral and Political Philosophy

Nietzsche’s moral philosophy is primarily critical in orientation: he attacks morality both for its commitment to untenable descriptive (metaphysical and empirical) claims about human agency, as well as for the deleterious impact of its distinctive norms and values on the flourishing of the highest types of human beings (Nietzsche’s “higher men”). His positive ethical views are best understood as combining (i) a kind of consequentialist perfectionism as Nietzsche’s implicit theory of the good, with (ii) a conception of human perfection involving both formal and substantive elements. Because Nietzsche, however, is an anti-realist about value, he takes neither his positive vision, nor those aspects of his critique that depend upon it, to have any special epistemic status, a fact which helps explain his rhetoric and the circumspect character of his “esoteric” moralizing. Although Nietzsche’s illiberal attitudes (for example, his rejection of the moral equality of human beings) are apparent, there are no grounds for ascribing to him a political philosophy, since he has no systematic (or even partly systematic) views about the nature of state and society. As an esoteric moralist, Nietzsche aims at freeing higher human beings from their false consciousness about morality (their false belief that this morality is good for them), not at a transformation of society at large.

• 1. The Critique of Morality
  • 1.1 Scope of the Critique: Morality in the Pejorative Sense
  • 1.2 Critique of the Descriptive Component of MPS
  • 1.3 Critique of the Normative Component of MPS
• 2. Nietzsche’s Positive Ethical Vision
• 3. Nietzsche’s Metaethics
  • 3.1 Privilege Readings
  • 3.2 Nietzsche’s Anti-Realism
  • 3.3 Nietzsche’s Sentimentalism
• 4. Nietzsche’s Lack of a Political Philosophy
• Bibliography
  • A. Nietzsche’s Writings and Key to Citations
  • B. References and Works on Nietzsche’s Moral and Political Philosophy
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Critique of Morality

1.1 Scope of the Critique: Morality in the Pejorative Sense

Nietzsche is not a critic of all “morality.” He explicitly embraces, for example, the idea of a “higher morality” which would inform the lives of “higher men” (Schacht 1983: 466–469), and, in so doing, he employs the same German word (usually Moral, sometimes Moralität) for what he attacks and what he praises. Moreover, Nietzsche aims to offer a revaluation of existing values in a manner that appears, itself, to involve appeal to broadly “moral” standards of some sort. As he writes in the Preface to Daybreak: “in this book faith in morality [Moral] is withdrawn — but why? Out of morality [Moralität]! Or what else should we call that which informs it — and us?….[T]here is no doubt that a ‘thou shalt’ [du sollst] speaks to us too” (D 4). This means, of course, that morality as the object of Nietzsche’s critique must be distinguishable from the sense of “morality” he retains and employs.

Yet Nietzsche also does not confine his criticisms of morality to some one religiously, philosophically, socially or historically circumscribed example. Thus, it will not suffice to say that he simply attacks Christian or Kantian or European or utilitarian morality — though he certainly at times attacks all of these. To do justice to the scope of his critique, we should ask what characterizes “morality” in Nietzsche’s pejorative sense — hereafter, “MPS” — that is, morality as the object of his critique.

Nietzsche believes that all “moralities” share certain structural characteristics, even as the content of these moralities varies considerably over time. In particular, all moralities have both descriptive and normative components, in the sense that: (a) they presuppose a particular descriptive account of human being and human agency, in the sense that for the normative claims comprising the morality to have intelligible application to humans, particular metaphysical and empirical claims about human beings and agency must be true; and (b) the morality’s norms favor the interests of some people, often (though not necessarily) at the expense of others. Any particular morality will, in turn, be the object of Nietzsche’s critique (i.e., MPS) only if it:

1. presupposes three particular descriptive claims about the nature of humans pertaining to free will, the transparency of the self, and their essential similarity in morally relevant respects (“the Descriptive Component”); and/or
2. embraces norms that harm the “highest men” while benefiting the “lowest” (“the Normative Component”).

While Nietzsche offers criticisms of both the Descriptive and Normative Components of MPS, what ultimately defines MPS as against unobjectionable moralities is the distinctive normative agenda. Thus, while Nietzsche criticizes the description of agency that is part of many versions of MPS, he also holds that “[i]t is not error as error that” he objects to fundamentally in MPS (EH IV;7): that is, it is not the falsity of the descriptive account of agency presupposed by MPS, per se, that is the heart of the problem, but rather its distinctive normative commitments. Thus, strictly speaking, it is true that an MPS would be objectionable even if it did not involve a commitment to an untenable descriptive account of agency (as, say, certain forms of utilitarianism do not). Because Nietzsche’s two most common — and closely related — specific targets are, however, Christian and Kantian morality, the critique of the descriptive component of MPS figures prominently in Nietzsche’s writing, and any account of the logic of his critique that omitted it would not do justice to his concerns.

1.2 Critique of the Descriptive Component of MPS

MPS for Nietzsche depends for its intelligible application to human agents on three descriptive theses about human agency (see BGE 32; GM I:13; TI VI; EH III:5; EH IV:8):

(1) Human agents possess a will capable of free choice (“Free Will Thesis”).

(2) The self is sufficiently transparent that agents’ actions can be distinguished on the basis of their respective motives (“Transparency of the Self Thesis”).

(3) Human agents are sufficiently similar that one moral code is in the interests of all (“Similarity Thesis”).

These three theses must be true in order for the normative judgments of MPS to be intelligible because the normative judgments of MPS are marked for Nietzsche by some or all of three corresponding traits; namely, that they:

(1′) Hold agents morally responsible for their actions.

(2′) Evaluate and “rank” the motives for which agents act.

(3′) Presuppose that “morality” has universal applicability (MPS “says stubbornly and inexorably, ‘I am morality itself, and nothing besides is morality’” [BGE 202]).

Thus, the falsity of the picture of human beings would affect the intelligibility of moral judgments in the following three ways:

(1″) If agents lacked “free will” they could not be morally responsible for their actions.

(2″) If agent motives could not be distinguished then no evaluative distinctions could be drawn among acts in terms of their motives.

(3″) If humans were, in fact, different in some overlooked but relevant respect, then it would, at least, not be prima facie apparent that one morality should have universal application.

It is the burden, then, of Nietzsche’s critique of the Descriptive Component of MPS to show that, in fact, none of these latter theses about the nature of agency hold. A brief review of these arguments follows (a more detailed treatment is in Leiter 2002: 81–112 and Leiter 2019a: 115–146).

Against the Free Will Thesis, Nietzsche argues against both modern attempts to vindicate free will and moral responsibility. On libertarian views, a free will (that is, one sufficiently free to support ascriptions of moral responsibility) would have to be causa sui (i.e., self-caused, or the cause of itself); but since we are not causa sui, no one can have free will. Nietzsche often takes for granted — not implausibly — that our moral and religious traditions are incompatibilist at their core: causally determined wills are not free wills. (This assumption appears to be widely shared by scientists who write about free will [e.g., Sapolsky 2023]). But Nietzsche also argues against what we now call “compatibilist” views of free will and moral responsibility according to which (1) we are free and morally responsible as long as we do what we desire or we “identify” with the desires on which we act; or (2) we are free and morally responsible as long as we are responsive to relevant reasons for acting.

Nietzsche offers two kinds of arguments to show that we are not causa sui: that it is logically impossible to be causa sui; and that human beings are not self-caused in a sense sufficient to underwrite ascriptions of moral responsibility. He says relatively little about the first point, other than claiming that “the concept of a causa sui is something fundamentally absurd” (BGE 15), and that it is “the best self-contradiction that has been conceived so far…a sort of rape and perversion of logic” (BGE 21), such that this,

desire for “freedom of the will” in the superlative metaphysical sense…the desire to bear the entire and ultimate responsibility for one’s actions oneself, and to absolve God, the world, ancestors, chance, and society involves nothing less than to be precisely this causa sui and…to pull oneself up into existence by the hair, out of the swamps of nothingness. (BGE 21)

But we cannot, needless to say, pull ourselves up “out of the swamps of nothingness,” and so we cannot have ultimate responsibility for our actions. (Only God is causa sui, and Nietzsche takes it for granted that there is no God.)

Nietzsche quickly moves from the claim that being causa sui involves a contradiction, however, to an argument that depends on his picture of human agency. Nietzsche accepts what we may call a “Doctrine of Types” (Leiter 1998, 2002, 2015), according to which,

Each person has a fixed psycho-physical constitution, which defines him as a particular type of person.

Call the relevant psycho-physical facts here “type-facts.” Type-facts, for Nietzsche, are either physiological facts about the person, or facts about the person’s unconscious drives or affects. The claim, then, is that each person has certain largely immutable physiological and psychic traits that constitute the “type” of person he or she is. (They may not be wholly immutable: e.g., drives that are strong at one point in a person’s life, may be less strong at another point: they may wax and wane.)

Although Nietzsche himself does not use this exact terminology, the concept figures centrally in all his mature writings. A typical Nietzschean form of argument, for example, runs as follows: a person’s theoretical beliefs are best explained in terms of his moral beliefs; and his moral beliefs are best explained in terms of natural facts about the type of person he is (i.e., in terms of type-facts). So Nietzsche says, “every great philosophy so far has been…the personal confession of its author and a kind of involuntary and unconscious memoir”; thus, to really grasp this philosophy, one must ask “at what morality does all this (does he) aim” (BGE 6)? But the “morality” that a philosopher embraces simply bears “decisive witness to who he is” — i.e., who he essentially is — that is, to the “innermost drives of his nature” (BGE 6).

This explanation of a person’s moral beliefs in terms of psycho-physical facts about the person is a recurring theme in Nietzsche. “[M]oralities are…merely a sign language of the affects” (BGE 187), he says. “Answers to the questions about the value of existence…may always be considered first of all as the symptoms of certain bodies” (GS P:2). “Moral judgments,” he says are, “symptoms and sign languages which betray the process of physiological prosperity or failure” (WP 258). “[O]ur moral judgments and evaluations…are only images and fantasies based on a physiological process unknown to us” (D 119), so that “it is always necessary to draw forth…the physiological phenomenon behind the moral predispositions and prejudices” (D 542). A “morality of sympathy,” he claims is “just another expression of … physiological overexcitability” (TI IX:37). Ressentiment — and the morality that grows out of it — he attributes to an “actual physiological cause [Ursache]” (GM I:15).

Nietzsche sums up the idea well in the preface to On the Genealogy of Morality (hereafter simply “Genealogy” or “GM”): “our thoughts, values, every ‘yes,’ ‘no,’ ‘if’ and ‘but’ grow from us with the same inevitability as fruits borne on the tree — all related and each with an affinity to each, and evidence of one will, one health, one earth, one sun” (GM P:2). Nietzsche seeks to understand in naturalistic terms the type of “person” who would necessarily bear such ideas and values, just as one might come to understand things about a type of tree by knowing its fruits. And just as natural facts about the tree explain the fruit it bears, so too type-facts about a person will explain his values and actions.

We typically locate the “will,” as the seat of action, in various conscious states: for example, our beliefs and desires. According to Nietzsche, however, the “will” so conceived is nothing but the effect of type-facts about the person. This means that the real story of the genesis of an action begins with the type-facts, which explain both consciousness and a person’s actions. Here is how Nietzsche puts it, after suggesting that the “will” is related to, but conceptually prior to, the concepts of “consciousness” and “ego”:

The “inner world” is full of phantoms…: the will is one of them. The will no longer moves anything, hence does not explain anything either — it merely accompanies events; it can also be absent. The so-called motive: another error. Merely a surface phenomenon of consciousness — something alongside the deed that is more likely to cover up the antecedents of the deeds than to represent them….

What follows from this? There are no mental [geistigen] causes at all. (TI VI:3)

In the last line, Nietzsche must mean only that there are no conscious mental causes. Indeed, in other passages, he is explicit that the target of this critique is the picture of conscious motives as adequate to account for action. (Riccardi 2019 and 2021 is the most important treatment; see also, Fowles 2019 and Leiter 2019a: 135–139 for related discussion). As he writes in Daybreak, “we are accustomed to exclude all [the] unconscious processes from the accounting and to reflect on the preparation for an act only to the extent that it is conscious” (D 129), a view which Nietzsche plainly regards as mistaken, both here and in the passage quoted above. Indeed, the theme of the “ridiculous overestimation and misunderstanding of consciousness” (GS 11) is a recurring one in Nietzsche. “[B]y far the greatest part of our spirit’s activity,” says Nietzsche, “remains unconscious and unfelt” (GS 333; cf. GS 354).

Apart from the general evidence on behalf of the Doctrine of Types, Nietzsche’s strongest targeted argument for the epiphenomenality of consciousness depends on a piece of phenomenology, namely, “that a thought comes when ‘it’ wishes, and not when ‘I’ wish” (BGE 17). If that is right and if actions are apparently “caused” by thoughts (by particular beliefs and desires), then it follows that actions are not caused solely by our conscious mental states, but rather by whatever it is (i.e., type-facts) that determines the thoughts that enter consciousness. Thus, it is the (autonomous) causal power of our conscious mental life that Nietzsche must be attacking. Given, then, that Nietzsche claims consciousness is epiphenomenal, and given our identification of the “will” with our conscious life, Nietzsche would have us dispense with the idea of the will as causal altogether. (This gives Nietzsche a novel argument against hierarchical accounts of free will favored by some compatibilists: see Leiter 2002: 93–96. It also undermines more recent forms of compatibilism based on reasons-responsiveness: if deliberation, or conscious reasoning,, is epiphenomenal, then why should an antecedent but non-causal correlation between antecedently consciously experienced reasons and a subsequent action ground responsibility? Barometers drop before storms, after all, but they do not cause them and are not blameworthy for them. See Leiter 2019a: 144–146). Since the conscious will is not causal, the Free Will Thesis is false. (Note that even if Nietzsche rejects any concept of free will compatible with moral responsibility, he arguably still accepts a revisionary notion of free will. Rutherford 2011 suggests Nietzsche has more in common with the Stoics and Spinoza when it comes to “free will”: free actions are just ones arising from our real inner nature, but we can not choose to be the type of person whose actions arise from their real nature, since that too is a matter of fate.)

Against the Transparency of the Self Thesis, Nietzsche claims that “every action is unknowable” (GS 335; cf. WP 291, 294); as he writes in Daybreak:

The primeval delusion still lives on that one knows, and knows quite precisely in every case, how human action is brought about…. “I know what I want, what I have done, I am free and responsible for it, I hold others responsible, I can call by its name every moral possibility and every inner motion which precedes action; you may act as you will — in this matter I understand myself and understand you all!” — that is how…almost everyone still thinks….[But] [a]ctions are never what they appear to us to be! We have expended so much labor on learning that external things are not as they appear to us to be — very well! the case is the same with the inner world! Moral actions are in reality “something other than that” — more we cannot say: and all actions are essentially unknown. (D 116)

Actions are unknown because “nothing…can be more incomplete than [one’s] image of the totality of drives which constitute [a man’s] being” (D 119). One “can scarcely name even the cruder ones: their number and strength, their ebb and flow, their play and counterplay among one another, and above all the laws of their nutriment remain wholly unknown” (D 119). But as Nietzsche argues elsewhere (e.g., D 109), the self is merely the arena in which the struggle of drives plays itself out, and one’s actions are the outcomes of the struggle (see Leiter 2002: 99–104; cf. Riccardi 2015b and 2021; for a general account of Nietzsche’s philosophical psychology of drives, see Katsafanas 2013a).

Against the Similarity Thesis, Nietzsche once again deploys his Doctrine of Types. Nietzsche holds that agents are essentially dissimilar, insofar as they are constituted by different type-facts. Since Nietzsche also holds that these natural type-facts fix the different conditions under which particular agents will flourish, it follows that one morality cannot be good for all. “Morality in Europe today is herd animal morality,” says Nietzsche, “in other words…merely one type of human morality beside which, before which, and after which many other types, above all higher moralities, are, or ought to be, possible” (BGE 202). Nietzsche illustrates the general point with his discussion of the case of the Italian writer Cornaro in Twilight of the Idols (VI:1). Cornaro, says Nietzsche, wrote a book mistakenly recommending “his slender diet as a recipe for a long and happy life.” But why was this a mistake? Nietzsche explains:

The worthy Italian thought his diet was the cause of his long life, whereas the precondition for a long life, the extraordinary slowness of his metabolism, the consumption of so little, was the cause of his slender diet. He was not free to eat little or much; his frugality was not a matter of “free will”: he became sick when he ate more. But whoever is not a carp not only does well to eat properly, but needs to.

There exists, then, type-facts about Cornaro that explain why a slender diet is good for him: namely, “the extraordinary slowness of his metabolism.” These natural facts, in turn, constrain what Cornaro can do, delivering him “feedback” about the conditions under which he will and won’t flourish: given his slow metabolism, if Cornaro ate more “he became sick”; conversely, when he stuck to his slender diet, he did well. In sum, “[h]e was not free to eat little or much.” Cornaro’s mistake consists, in effect, in his absolutism: he thought the “good” diet was good for everyone, when in fact it was only good for certain types of bodies (namely, those with slow metabolisms). As with diets, so too with moralities, according to Nietzsche. Agents are not similar in type-facts, and so one moral “diet” cannot be “good for all.” As he writes:

[T]he question is always who he is, and who the other person is…Every unegoistic morality that takes itself for unconditional and addresses itself to all does not only sin against taste: it is a provocation to sins of omission, one more seduction under the mask of philanthropy — and precisely a seduction and injury for the higher, rarer, privileged. (BGE 221)

This point sets the stage for his core critique of morality.

1.3 Critique of the Normative Component of MPS

All of Nietzsche’s criticisms of the normative component of MPS are parasitic upon one basic complaint — not, as some have held (e.g., Nehamas [1985], Geuss [1997]), the universality of moral demands, per se, but rather that “the demand of one morality for all is detrimental to the higher men” (BGE 228). Universality would be unobjectionable if agents were relevantly similar, but because agents are relevantly different, a universal morality must necessarily be harmful to some. As Nietzsche writes elsewhere: “When a decadent type of man ascended to the rank of the highest type [via MPS], this could only happen at the expense of its countertype [emphasis added], the type of man that is strong and sure of life” (EH III:5). In the preface to the Genealogy, Nietzsche sums up his basic concern particularly well:

What if a symptom of regression lurked in the “good,” likewise a danger, a seduction, a poison, a narcotic, through which the present lived at the expense of the future? Perhaps more comfortably, less dangerously, but at the same time in a meaner style, more basely? — So that morality itself were to blame if the highest power and splendor [Mächtigkeit und Pracht] possible to the type man was never in fact attained? So that morality itself was the danger of dangers? (GM Pref:6; cf. BT Attempt:5)

This theme is sounded throughout Nietzsche’s work. In a book of 1880, for example, he writes that, “Our weak, unmanly social concepts of good and evil and their tremendous ascendancy over body and soul have finally weakened all bodies and souls and snapped the self-reliant, independent, unprejudiced men, the pillars of a strong civilization” (D 163). Similarly, in a posthumously published note of 1885, he remarks that “men of great creativity, the really great men according to my understanding, will be sought in vain today” because “nothing stands more malignantly in the way of their rise and evolution…than what in Europe today is called simply ‘morality’” (WP 957). In these and many other passages (e.g., BGE 62; GM III:14; A:5, 24; EH IV:4; WP 274, 345, 400, 870, 879.), Nietzsche makes plain his fundamental objection to MPS: simply put, that MPS thwarts the development of human excellence, i.e., “the highest power and splendor possible to the type man” (for more on the “higher man,” see section (2)).

There is another, competing reading of Nietzsche’s central complaint about MPS: namely, that it is “harmful to life” or, more simply, “anti-nature.” Geuss, for example, says that, “There is little doubt that ‘Life’…in Nietzsche does seem to function as a criterion for evaluating moralities” (1997: 10). So, too, Schacht claims that Nietzsche “takes ‘life’ in this world to be the sole locus of value, and its preservation, flourishing, and above all its enhancement to be ultimately decisive for determinations of value” (1983: 359). Thus, the question of the value of MPS is really the question of its “value for life” (1983: 354). But what does that mean? After all, it is obvious that Nietzsche has nothing but contempt for most forms of human life, from St. Paul to Bismarck to the modern “herd.” So the real question has to be: what does “life” refer to? Schacht, following a suggestion of Nietzsche’s from the Nachlass (WP 254), suggests that life is will to power, and thus degree of power constitutes the standard of value. (We shall return to this suggestion in detail in section 3.1, below.) But this involves no gain in precision. Nietzsche may, indeed, have thought that more “power” — in his sense — was more valuable than less, but that still leaves us with the question: power of what or of whom? The only plausible candidate — given especially his other remarks discussed above — is power of people; just as the only plausible candidate for the “life” that Nietzsche considers it valuable to preserve and enhance must be the lives of people and, in particular, the lives of the “highest men.”

That this is what Nietzsche means is revealed by the context of his actual remarks about the “value for life.” For example, he comments that “a higher and more fundamental value for life might have to be ascribed to deception, selfishness, and lust” (BGE 2, emphasis added). But what sort of “life” is, e.g., “selfishness” valuable for? As Nietzsche writes elsewhere (e.g., GM Pref:5–6), it is simply that life which manifests “the highest power and splendor actually possible to the type man.” And similarly, when Nietzsche says that a “tendency hostile to life is therefore characteristic of morality,” it is clear in context that what “life” refers to is “the type man” who might be “raised to his greatest splendor and power” (that is, but for the interference of MPS) (WP 897). In short, then, the things Nietzsche identifies as “valuable” for life are those he takes to be necessary for the flourishing of the highest types of life (or human excellence), while those that he identifies as harmful to it are those that he takes to be things that constitute obstacles to such flourishing. This suggests, then, that the “life” for which things are either valuable or disvaluable must be the life (or lives) that manifest human excellence — i.e., the lives of “higher men.”

Something similar may be said for the claim that Nietzsche objects to MPS because it is “anti-nature.” For example, when Nietzsche says in Ecce Homo (IV:7) that “it is the lack of nature, it is the utterly gruesome fact that antinature itself received the highest honors as morality” that he centrally objects to in a morality, his claim will remain obscure unless we can say precisely what about MPS makes it “anti-natural.” Nietzsche, himself, offers guidance on this in the same section when he explains that a MPS is anti-natural insofar as it has the following sorts of characteristics: it teaches men “to despise the very first instincts of life” and “to experience the presupposition of life, sexuality, as something unclean”; and it “looks for the evil principle in what is most profoundly necessary for growth, in severe self-love” (EH IV:7). From the preceding, it is now apparent that it is not anti-naturalness itself that is objectionable, but rather the consequences of an anti-natural MPS that are at issue: for example, its opposition to the instincts that are “profoundly necessary for growth.” This point is even more explicit in The Antichrist, where Nietzsche notes that Christian morality “has waged deadly war against this higher type of man; it has placed all the basic instincts of his type under ban” (5, emphasis added). In other words, the anti-naturalness of MPS is objectionable because the “natural” instincts MPS opposes are precisely those necessary for the growth of the “higher type of man.” Thus, underlying Nietzsche’s worries about the anti-naturalness of MPS — just as underlying his worries about the threat MPS poses to life — is a concern for the effect of MPS on “higher men.”

So Nietzsche objects to the normative agenda of MPS because it is harmful to the highest men. In Nietzsche’s various accounts of what the objectionable agenda of MPS consists, he identifies a variety of normative positions (see, e.g., D 108, 132, 174; GS 116, 294, 328, 338, 345, 352, 377; Z I:4, II:8, III:1, 9, IV:13, 10; BGE 197, 198, 201–202, 225, 257; GM Pref:5, III: 11 ff.; TI II, V, IX:35, 37–38, 48; A: 7, 43; EH III:D-2, IV:4, 7–8; WP 752). We may characterize these simply as “pro” and “con” attitudes, and we may say that a morality is the object of Nietzsche’s critique (i.e., it is an MPS) if it contains one or more of the following normative views (this is a representative, but not exhaustive, list):

Pro	Con
Happiness	Suffering
Altruism/Selflessness	Self-love or self-interest
Equality	Inequality
Pity/Compassion for those who suffer	Indifference to those who suffer

The various possible normative components of MPS should, of course, be understood construed as ideal-typical, singling out for emphasis and criticism certain important features of larger and more complex normative views. Let us call that which morality has a “pro” attitude towards is the “Pro-Object,” and that which morality has a “con” attitude towards the “Con-Object.” Keeping in mind that what seems to have intrinsic value for Nietzsche is human excellence or human greatness (see the next section), Nietzsche’s attack on the normative component of MPS can be summarized as having two parts:

(a) With respect to the Pro-Object, Nietzsche argues either (i) that the Pro-Object has no intrinsic value (in the cases where MPS claims it does); or (ii) that it does not have any or not nearly as much extrinsic value as MPS treats it as having; and

(b) With respect to the Con-Object, Nietzsche argues only that the Con-Objects are extrinsically valuable for the cultivation of human excellence — and that this is obscured by the “con” attitude endorsed by MPS.

Thus, what unifies Nietzsche’s seemingly disparate critical remarks — about altruism, happiness, pity, equality, Kantian respect for persons, utilitarianism, etc. — is that he thinks a culture in which such norms prevail as morality will be a culture which eliminates the conditions for the realization of human excellence — the latter requiring, on Nietzsche’s view, concern with the self, suffering, a certain stoic indifference, a sense of hierarchy and difference, and the like. Indeed, when we turn to the details of Nietzsche’s criticisms of these norms we find that, in fact, this is precisely what he argues. One detailed example will have to suffice here.

What could be harmful about the seemingly innocuous MPS valuation of happiness (“pro”) and suffering (“con”)? An early remark of Nietzsche’s suggests his answer:

Are we not, with this tremendous objective of obliterating all the sharp edges of life, well on the way to turning mankind into sand? Sand! Small, soft, round, unending sand! Is that your ideal, you heralds of the sympathetic affections? (D 174)

In a later work, Nietzsche says — referring to hedonists and utilitarians — that, “Well-being as you understand it — that is no goal, that seems to us an end, a state that soon makes man ridiculous and contemptible…” (BGE 225). By the hedonistic doctrine of well-being, Nietzsche takes the utilitarians to have in mind “English happiness,” namely, “comfort and fashion” (BGE 228) — a construal which, if unfair to some utilitarians (like Mill), may do justice to our ordinary aspirations to happiness. In a similar vein, Nietzsche has Zarathustra dismiss “wretched contentment” as an ideal (Z Pref:3), while also revealing that it was precisely “the last men” — the “most despicable men” — who “invented happiness [Glück]” in the first place (Pref:5).

So happiness, according to Nietzsche, is not an intrinsically valuable end, and men who aim for it — directly or through cultivating the dispositions that lead to it — would be “ridiculous and contemptible.” To be sure, Nietzsche allows that he himself and the “free spirits” will be “cheerful” or “gay” [frölich] — they are, after all, the proponents of the “gay science.” But the point is that such “happiness” is not criterial of being a higher person, and thus it is not something that the higher person — in contrast to the adherent of MPS — aims for.

Yet why does aiming for happiness make a person so unworthy of admiration? Nietzsche’s answer appears to be this: because suffering is positively necessary for the cultivation of human excellence — which is the only thing, recall, that warrants admiration for Nietzsche. He writes, for example, that:

The discipline of suffering, of great suffering — do you not know that only this discipline has created all enhancements of man so far? That tension of the soul in unhappiness which cultivates its strength, its shudders face to face with great ruin, its inventiveness and courage in enduring, persevering, interpreting, and exploiting suffering, and whatever has been granted to it of profundity, secret, mask, spirit, cunning, greatness — was it not granted to it through suffering, through the discipline of great suffering? (BGE 225; cf. BGE 270)

Nietzsche is not arguing here that — in contrast to the view of MPS — suffering is intrinsically valuable (not even MPS claims that). The value of suffering, according to Nietzsche, is only extrinsic: suffering — “great” suffering — is a prerequisite of any great human achievement. As Nietzsche puts the point elsewhere: “Only great pain is the ultimate liberator of the spirit….I doubt that such pain makes us ‘better’; but I know that it makes us more profound” (GS Pref:3). Nietzsche’s attack, then, conforms to the model sketched above: (i) he rejects the view that happiness is intrinsically valuable; and (ii) he thinks that the negative attitude of MPS toward suffering obscures its important extrinsic value. (There is reason to think that, on this second point, Nietzsche is generalizing from his own experience with physical suffering, the worst periods of which coincided with his greatest productivity. Indeed, he believed that his suffering contributed essentially to his work: as he writes, admittedly hyperbolically, in Ecce Homo: “In the midst of the torments that go with an uninterrupted three-day migraine, accompanied by laborious vomiting of phlegm, I possessed a dialectician’s clarity par excellence and thought through with very cold blood matters for which under healthier circumstances I am not mountain-climber, not subtle, not cold enough” (EH I:1).)

Even if there is no shortage in the history of art and literature of cases of immense suffering being the spur to great creativity, there remains a serious worry about the logic of this line of Nietzschean critique. Following Leiter (2002), we may call this the “Harm Puzzle,” and the puzzle is this: why should one think the general moral prescription to alleviate suffering must stop the suffering of great artists, hence stop them from producing great art? One might think, in fact, that MPS could perfectly well allow an exception for those individuals whose own suffering is essential to the realization of central life projects. After all, a prescription to alleviate suffering reflects a concern with promoting well-being, under some construal. If some individuals — nascent Goethes, Nietzsches, and other geniuses — would be better off with a good dose of suffering, then why would MPS recommend otherwise? Why, then, should it be the case that MPS “harms” potentially “higher men”?

This seems the natural philosophical question to ask, yet it also involves an important misunderstanding of Nietzsche’s critique, which is not, we might say, about philosophical theory but rather about the effects of a moral culture. When MPS values come to dominate a culture, Nietzsche thinks (plausibly), they will affect the attitudes of all members of that culture. If MPS values emphasize the badness of suffering and the goodness of happiness, that will influence how individuals with the potential for great achievements understand, evaluate and conduct their own lives. If, in fact, suffering is a precondition for these individuals to do anything great, and if they have internalized the norm that suffering must be alleviated, and that happiness is the ultimate goal, then we run the risk that, rather than — to put it crudely — suffer and create, they will instead waste their energies pursuing pleasure, lamenting their suffering and seeking to alleviate it. MPS values may not explicitly prohibit artists or other potentially “excellent” persons from ever suffering; but the risk is that a culture — like ours — which has internalized the norms against suffering and for pleasure will be a culture in which potential artists — and other doers of great things — will, in fact, squander themselves in self-pity and the seeking of pleasure.

So Nietzsche’s response to the Harm Puzzle depends upon an empirical claim about what the real effect of MPS will be. The normative component of MPS is harmful not because its specific prescriptions and proscriptions explicitly require potentially excellent persons to forego that which allows them to flourish (the claim is not that a conscientious application of the “theory” of MPS is incompatible with the flourishing of higher men); rather, the normative component of MPS is harmful because in practice, and especially because of MPS’s commitment to the idea that one morality is appropriate for all, potentially higher men will come to adopt such values as applicable to themselves as well. Thus, the normative component of MPS is harmful because, in reality, it will have the effect of leading potentially excellent persons to value what is in fact not conducive to their flourishing and devalue what is in fact essential to it.

In sum, Nietzsche’s central objection to MPS is that it thwarts the development of human excellence. His argument for this, in each case, turns on identifying distinctive valuations of MPS, and showing how — as in the case of norms favoring happiness and devaluing suffering — they undermine the development of individuals who would manifest human excellence. (For discussion of other examples, see Leiter 2002: 134–136; Leiter 2015: 108–110.)

2. Nietzsche’s Positive Ethical Vision

While Nietzsche clearly thinks certain states of affairs have positive intrinsic value (in particular, the flourishing of higher men), there is more disagreement among interpreters about what kind of ethics arises from the latter valuation so central to his critique of morality. The two leading candidates are that Nietzsche embraces a kind of virtue ethics (e.g., Hunt 1991, Swanton 2005) and that he is a kind of perfectionist (Hurka 1993, Hurka 2007). These accounts turn out to overlap — the perfections of the latter account are often the virtues of the former — though the perfectionist account will prove to have certain other advantages, discussed below.

Any account of Nietzsche’s “positive ethics” confronts a threshold worry, namely, that Nietzsche’s naturalistic conception of persons and agency — and, in particular, his conception of persons as constituted by non-conscious type-facts that determine their actions — makes it unclear how Nietzsche could have a philosophical ethics in any conventional sense. If, as Nietzsche, says, we face “a brazen wall of fate; we are in prison, we can only dream ourselves free, not make ourselves free” (HAH II:33); if “the single human being is a piece of fatum from the front and from the rear, one law more, one necessity more for all that is yet to come and to be” (TI V:6); if (as he says more hyperbolically in Nachlass material) “the voluntary is absolutely lacking…everything has been directed along certain lines from the beginning” (WP 458); if (again hyperbolically) “one will become only that which one is (in spite of all: that means education, instruction, milieu, chance, and accident)” (WP 334); then it is hardly surprising that Nietzsche should also say, “A man as he ought to be: that sounds to us as insipid as ‘a tree as he ought to be’” (WP 332).

Yet a philosopher reluctant to talk about “man as he ought to be” is plainly ill-suited to the task of developing a normative ethics, understood as systematic and theoretical guidance for how to live, whether that guidance comes in the form of rules for behavior or dispositions of character to be cultivated. (There is an additional, and special difficulty, for those who think Nietzsche is a virtue ethicist, namely, that he also thinks genuine virtues are specific to individuals, meaning that there will be nothing general for the theorist to say about them [see, e.g., Z I:5].) This means we must approach the question of Nietzsche’s “positive” ethics in terms of explicating (1) what it is Nietzsche values, (2) what his criteria of evaluation are, and (3) what evaluative structure, if any, is exhibited by the answers to (1) and (2). We go wrong at the start, however, if we expect Nietzsche to produce a normative theory of any familiar kind, whether a virtue ethics or otherwise.

Importantly, the preceding points should not be read as denying that Nietzsche thinks values and evaluative judgments can have a causal impact on actions and thus on how lives unfold. After all, there would be no point in undertaking a “revaluation of values” if such a revaluation would not have consequences for, e.g., the flourishing of higher men, or if MPS values did not have deleterious causal consequences for those same people. Values make a causal difference, but, given Nietzsche’s epiphenomenalism about consciousness (discussed, above, in 1.1), they do not make this difference because of free, conscious choices individuals make to adopt certain moral rules or cultivate certain dispositions of character.

We can better appreciate Nietzsche’s unusual views on this score by looking more closely at the popular, but mistaken, idea that Nietzsche calls on people to “create themselves” (on the general topic, see Leiter 1998). Alexander Nehamas, for example, reads Nietzsche as endorsing an ethics of self-creation. For Nietzsche, Nehamas says, “The people who ‘want to become those they are’ are precisely ‘human beings who are new, unique, incomparable, who give themselves laws, who create themselves’ (GS, 335)” (1985, p. 174). Nehamas, however, truncates the quote from The Gay Science. For Nietzsche, in the full passage, continues as follows:

To that end [of creating ourselves] we must become the best learners and discoverers of everything that is lawful and necessary in the world: we must become physicists in order to be creators in this sense [wir müssen Physiker sein, um, in jenem Sinne, Schöpfer sein zu können] — while hitherto all valuations and ideals have been based on ignorance of physics … . Therefore: long live physics! (GS 335)

Creation “in this sense” is, then, a very special sense indeed: for it presupposes the discovery of what is “lawful and necessary” as revealed by physical science. The passage begins to make more sense in context. For in this same section, Nietzsche claims that “every action is unknowable,” though he adds:

…our opinions, valuations, and tables of what is good certainly belong among the most powerful levers in the involved mechanism of our actions, but…in any particular case the law of their mechanism is indemonstrable [unnachweisbar].

This observation leads Nietzsche immediately to the suggestion that we should create “our own new tables of what is good,” presumably with an eye to effecting the causal determination of our actions in new ways. However, we need help from science to identify the lawful patterns into which values and actions fall; even if the mechanisms are indemonstrable, science may at least reveal the patterns of value-inputs and action-outputs. So to create one’s self, “in this sense,” is to accept Nietzsche’s basically deterministic picture of action — as determined by sub-conscious causes (type-facts) that are hard to identify — but to use science (not literally physics) to help identify those “values” which figure in the causal determination of action in new, but predictable, ways.

Values, then, have a causal impact upon how people act and thus also on their life trajectories; but we cannot expect these impacts to flow from free, conscious choices that persons make. This would explain, of course, why we find so little in Nietzsche by way of argumentative or discursive support for his evaluative judgments: such intellectual devices are precisely the ones that would appeal to our conscious faculties, and thus would be idle with respect to the desired outcomes. Nietzsche’s often violent rhetorical style, by contrast, might be expected (or so Nietzsche presumably thinks) to have the requisite non-rational effect on his desired readers — those “whose ears are related to ours” (GS 381). (On Nietzsche’s style, and its relation to his philosophical psychology, see Janaway 2007 and Leiter 2013.) (More on this issue in Section 4, below.)

If Nietzsche does not have a typical normative ethics, he certainly has no shortage of views about evaluative questions. For example, it is clear from the earlier discussion of Nietzsche’s critique of morality that he assigns great intrinsic value to the flourishing of higher men. But who are these “higher men” and why does Nietzsche assign value to them? (Note that while Nietzsche speaks in Thus Spoke Zarathustra of the “superman” as a kind of ideal higher type, this concept simply drops out of his mature work [except for a brief mention in EH in the context of discussing Zarathustra]. “Higher men” is an important concept in Nietzsche; the “superman” is nothing more than a rhetorical trope in the highly stylized Zarathustra, which is written as a parody of The New Testament.)

Nietzsche has four favorite examples of “higher” human beings: Goethe, Beethoven, Napoleon, and Nietzsche himself! What makes these figures paradigms of the “higher” type for Nietzsche, beyond their great creativity (as he says, “the men of great creativity” are “the really great men according to my understanding” (WP 957))? (Napoleon may surprise modern readers, but he was frequently perceived as a “genius” in the 19th-century [a perception he tried to encourage], and he was not simply creative on the battlefield, but also by imposing a new bureaucratic and legal structure on much of Europe, which survives to this day. Despite that, Nietzche’s most common examples are creative geniuses in the intellectual and artistic realm.) We can identify five characteristics that Nietzsche identifies as distinctive of “higher men”: the higher type is solitary, pursues a “unifying project,” is healthy, is life-affirming, and practices self-reverence. Taken together, they are plainly sufficient to make someone a higher type in Nietzsche’s view, though it is not obvious that any one of these is necessary, and various combinations often seem sufficient for explaining how Nietzsche speaks of higher human beings.

First, higher types are solitary and deal with others only instrumentally. “Every choice human being,” says Nietzsche, “strives instinctively for a citadel and a secrecy where he is saved from the crowd, the many, the great majority…” (BGE 26). “[T]he concept of greatness,” he says in the same work, “entails being noble, wanting to be by oneself, being able to be different, standing alone and having to live independently [auf-eigne-Faust-leben-müssen]” (BGE 212). Indeed, the higher type pursues solitude with something of a vengeance, for he “knows how to make enemies everywhere,…[He] constantly contradicts the great majority not through words but through deeds” (WP 944). Unsurprisingly, then, the great or higher man lacks the “congeniality” and “good-naturedness” so often celebrated in contemporary popular culture. “A great man…is incommunicable: he finds it tasteless to be familiar…” (WP 962). More than that, though, the higher type deals with others, when he has to, in a rather distinctive way: “A human being who strives for something great considers everyone he meets on his way either as a means or as a delay and obstacle — or as a temporary resting place” (BGE 273). Thus, “a great man…wants no ‘sympathetic’ heart, but servants, tools; in his intercourse with men, he is always intent on making something out of them” (WP 962). The great man approaches others instrumentally not only because of his fundamental proclivity for solitude, but because of another distinguishing characteristic: he is consumed by his work, his responsibilities, his projects.

Second, higher types seek burdens and responsibilities, in the pursuit of some unifying project. “What is noble?” Nietzsche again asks in a Nachlass note of 1888. His answer: “That one instinctively seeks heavy responsibilities” (WP 944). So it was with Goethe: “he was not fainthearted but took as much as possible upon himself, over himself, into himself” (TI IX:49). But the higher type does not seek out responsibilities and tasks arbitrarily. “A great man,” says Nietzsche displays “a long logic in all of his activity…he has the ability to extend his will across great stretches of his life and to despise, and reject everything petty about him” (WP 962). This is the trait Nietzsche sometimes refers to as having “style” in “character” (GS 290). (Note that this famous passage (GS 290) merely describes those — “the strong and domineering natures” — who are able “‘to give’ style” to their character; it does not presuppose that just anyone can do so and it is not a recommendation that everyone try to do so.) Indeed, Nietzsche understood his own life in these terms:

[T]he organizing “idea” that is destined to rule [in one’s life and work] keeps growing deep down — it begins to command; slowly it leads us back from side roads and wrong roads; it prepares single qualities and fitnesses that will one day prove to be indispensable as means toward a whole — one by one, it trains all subservient capacities before giving any hint of the dominant task, “goal,” “aim,” or “meaning.”

Considered in this way, my life is simply wonderful. For the task of a revaluation of all values more capacities may have been needed than have ever dwelt together in a single individual….I never even suspected what was growing in me — and one day all my capacities, suddenly ripe, leaped forth in their ultimate perfection. (EH II:9).

Earlier in Ecce Homo, Nietzsche describes himself as a higher type, “a well-turned-out-person” (EH I:2), and thus we may conclude that it is a characteristic only of the higher type that he is driven in pursuit of a project in the way described here. Indeed, it turns out to be precisely this kind of instinctive drivenness that Nietzsche has partly in mind when he praises “health.”

Third, higher types are essentially healthy and resilient. One essential attribute of the “well-turned-out-person” is that he “has a taste only for what is good for him; his pleasure, his delight cease where the measure of what is good for him is transgressed. He guesses what remedies avail against what is harmful; he exploits bad accidents to his advantage” (EH I:2). But this is just to say that a higher type is healthy, for health, Nietzsche tells us, means simply “instinctively cho[osing] the right means against wretched states” (EH I:2). This permits us to understand Nietzsche’s own declaration in Ecce Homo that he was “healthy at bottom” (EH I:2), a seemingly paradoxical claim for a philosopher whose physical ailments were legion. Yet “health,” for Nietzsche, is a term of art, meaning not the absence of sickness, but something closer to resilience, to how one deals with ordinary (physical) sickness and setbacks. “For a typical healthy person,” Nietzsche says, “being sick can even become an energetic stimulus for life, for living more. This, in fact, is how [my own] long period of sickness appears to me now…it was during the years of my lowest vitality that I ceased to be a pessimist; the instinct of self-restoration forbade me a philosophy of poverty and discouragement” (EH I:2). To cease to be a pessimist is to reject MPS, for only under the color of MPS does life appear to lack value. Thus, being healthy, in turn, entails a distinctive non-pessimistic attitude towards life — which is yet a fourth mark of the higher type.

Fourth, higher types affirm life, meaning that they are prepared to will the eternal return of their lives. In Beyond Good and Evil, Nietzsche describes “the opposite ideal” to that of moralists and pessimists like Schopenhauer as “the ideal of the most high-spirited, alive, and world-affirming human being who has not only come to terms and learned to get along with whatever was and is, but who wants to have what was and is repeated into all eternity” (BGE 56). Put more simply: the higher type embraces the doctrine of the eternal recurrence and thus evinces what Nietzsche often calls a “Dionysian” or “life-affirming” attitude. A person, for Nietzsche, has a Dionysian attitude toward life insofar as he affirms his life unconditionally; in particular, insofar as he affirms it including the “suffering” or other hardships it has involved. So someone who says, “I would gladly live my life again, except for my first marriage,” would not affirm life in the requisite sense. Thus, we may say that a person affirms his life in Nietzsche’s sense only insofar as he would gladly will its eternal return: i.e., will the repetition of his entire life through eternity. In fact, Nietzsche calls “the idea of the eternal recurrence” the “highest formulation of affirmation that is at all attainable” (EH III:Z-1; cf. BGE 56). Higher men, then, are marked by a distinctive Dionysian attitude toward their life: they would gladly will the repetition of their life eternally.

Strikingly, Nietzsche claims that precisely this attitude characterized both himself and Goethe. Speaking, for example, of the neglect by his contemporaries of his work, Nietzsche writes: “I myself have never suffered from all this; what is necessary does not hurt me; amor fati [love of fate] is my inmost nature” (EH III:CW-4). Regarding Goethe, Nietzsche says that, “Such a spirit…stands amid the cosmos with a joyous and trusting fatalism, in the faith…that all is redeemed and affirmed in the whole….Such a faith, however, is the highest of all possible faiths: I have baptized it with the name of Dionysus” (TI IX:49).

Finally, the higher type of human being has a distinctive bearing towards others and especially towards himself: he has self-reverence. “The ‘higher nature’ of the great man,” says Nietzsche in a striking Nachlass note of 1888 “lies in being different, in incommunicability, in distance of rank, not in an effect of any kind — even if he made the whole globe tremble” (WP 876; cf. GS 55). This is perhaps the most unusual feature of Nietzsche’s discussion of the higher type, for it suggests that, at bottom, being a higher type is a matter of “attitude” or “bearing.” In a section of Beyond Good and Evil, Nietzsche once again answers the question, “What is noble?”, this time as follows: “It is not the works, it is the faith that is decisive here, that determines the order of rank…: some fundamental certainty that a noble soul has about itself, something that cannot be sought, nor found, nor perhaps lost. The noble soul has reverence [Ehrfurcht] for itself” (BGE 287). Self-reverence — to revere and respect oneself as one might a god — is no small achievement, as the proliferation of “self-help” programs and pop psychology slogans like “I’m OK, you’re OK” would suggest. Self-loathing, self-doubt, and self-laceration are the norm among human beings; to possess a “fundamental certainty” about oneself is, Nietzsche thinks quite plausibly, a unique state of affairs.

Allied with this posture of self-reverence are other distinctive attitudes that distinguish the bearing of the higher man. “The noble human being,” says Nietzsche, “honors himself as one who is powerful, also as one who has power over himself, who knows how to speak and be silent, who delights in being severe and hard with himself and respects all severity and hardness” (BGE 260). (The higher man, unsurprisingly, is no hedonist: “What is noble?” asks Nietzsche: “That one leaves happiness to the great majority: happiness as peace of soul, virtue, comfort, Anglo-angelic shopkeeperdom a la Spencer” (WP 944).) In an earlier work, Nietzsche explains that:

[T]he passion that attacks those who are noble is peculiar….It involves the use of a rare and singular standard cold to everybody else; the discovery of values for which no scales have been invented yet; offering sacrifices on altars that are dedicated to an unknown god; a courage without any desire for honors; self-sufficiency that overflows and gives to men and things. (GS 55)

Indeed, the ability to set his own standard of valuation is one of the most distinctive achievements of the higher type, as we saw already in the discussion of solitude. And “the highest man” says Nietzsche is “he who determines values and directs the will of millennia by giving direction to the highest natures” (WP 999).

Considered all together, it becomes clear why creatives geniuses like Goethe, Beethoven, and Nietzsche himself should be the preferred examples of the higher human being: for the characteristics of the higher type so-described are precisely those that lend themselves to artistic and creative work. A penchant for solitude, an absolute devotion to one’s tasks, an indifference to external opinion, a fundamental certainty about oneself and one’s values (that often strikes others as hubris) — all these are the traits we find, again and again, in artistic geniuses. (It turns out, for example, that Beethoven, according to biographies, had almost all these characteristics to a striking degree.)

If “the men of great creativity, the really great men according to my understanding” (WP 957), men like Goethe and Beethoven, are Nietzsche’s paradigmatic higher types, whose lives are models of flourishing excellence, is there anything systematic to be said about the theory of value that undergirds these judgments and informs, in turn, Nietzsche’s critique of morality (MPS) on the grounds that it thwarts the development of such men?

One popular idea (e.g., Schacht 1983, Richardson 1996) is that higher men exemplify “power,” which is claimed to be Nietzsche’s fundamental criterion of value. Such readings, alas, have to employ the concept of “power” rather elastically, since the conglomeration of traits of higher human beings noted above don’t seem to be, in any ordinary sense, instances of “power” or its manifestation. (Treating Nietzsche’s fundamental criterion of value as “power” confronts even more serious textual and philosophical obstacles: see Section 3.1, below.)

More illuminating is Hurka’s view (1993 and Hurka 2007) that Nietzsche’s evaluative posture conjoins perfectionism with maximizing consequentialism: what has value are certain human excellences (or perfections), and states of affairs are assessed in terms of their maximization of these excellences. As Hurka helpfully observes (1993: 75), Nietzsche seems to operate with the opposite of Rawls’s maximin principle, what Hurka calls appropriately “maximax.” Hurka states this as a rule for conduct (“each agent’s overriding goal should be not a sum or average of lifetime value, but the greatest lifetime value of the single most perfect individual, or, if perfections are not fully comparable, of the few most perfect individuals” [1993: 75]), but given the earlier caveats about reading Nietzsche as a conventional normative theorist, it is better to treat maximax as reflecting the implicit structure of Nietzsche’s revaluation of values: he rejects MPS because it fails to maximize the perfection of the highest human beings, and he does so without, it appears, any regard for the costs to the herd of such a rejection (see Section 4).

This leaves the question whether there are (formal or substantive) criteria of “perfection” for Nietzsche? Many writers (e.g., Hurka 2007; Nehamas 1985; Richardson 1996) are attracted to the idea that “style” or “unity” is a criterion of excellence or perfection for Nietzsche, and, indeed, as noted above, the pursuit of a unified or coherent life project is a characteristic feature of those Nietzsche deems to be higher men. Whether such style or coherence suffices is a vexed interpretive question, since it is not entirely clear that the formal criterion of style or unity is available only to Goethes and Beethovens: did not Kant, that “catastrophic spider” as Nietzsche unflatteringly calls him (A 11), exhibit an extraordinarily coherent style of creative productivity over many years?

Others (e.g., Magnus 1978) take Nietzsche’s idea of eternal recurrence (the hallmark of life-affirmation, as noted above) as the criterion of a well-lived life: perfection is a matter of living in such a way that one is ready to gladly will the repetition of one’s life, in all its particulars, in to eternity. This, too, seems both too thin and too severe as a criterion of perfection standing alone: too thin, because anyone suitably superficial and complacent might will the eternal return; too severe, because it seems to require that a post-Holocaust Goethe gladly will the repetition of the Holocaust.

Nehamas (1985), who shares some of Magnus’s view, adds a surprising twist to this account: he claims that Nietzsche does not describe his ideal person — his “higher man” — but rather “exemplifies” such a person in the form of the “character” that is constituted by and exemplified in his corpus. Nietzsche, however, describes at great length and in many places (e.g. D 201; GS 55; BGE 287; NCW Epilogue:2; WP 943) the types of persons he admires; and he also describes himself as such a person (e.g., EH I:2) Nehamas’s view would also have the odd consequence that for Nietzsche to have had a positive ethical vision at any point earlier in his career he would have had to anticipate writing the series of books he actually wrote, such that his ethical ideal would be properly exemplified in them.

3. Nietzsche’s Metaethics

Nietzsche holds that moral (i.e., MPS) values are not conducive to the flourishing of human excellence, and it is by reference to this fact that he proposed to assess their value. The enterprise of assessing the value of certain other values (call them the ‘revalued values’) naturally invites the metaethical question: what status — metaphysical, epistemological — do the values used to undertake this revaluation (the ‘assessing values’) enjoy? (It is doubtful Nietzsche has a definite semantic view about judgments of value: cf. Hussain 2013, esp. 412.) We may distinguish “Privilege Readings” of Nietzsche’s metaethics — which claim that Nietzsche holds that his own evaluative standpoint is either veridical or better justified than its target — from those readings which deny the claim of privilege. (Note that defenders of this latter, “skeptical” view need not read Nietzsche as a global anti-realist — i.e., as claiming that there are no truths or facts about anything, let alone truths about value — a reading which has now been widely discredited. There is, on the skeptical view at issue here, a special problem about the objectivity of value. For an argument that Nietzsche is a global anti-realist about value in particular, see Leiter 2019a: 84–111.)

3.1 Privilege Readings

Privilege Readings of Nietzsche come in two main varieties: Realist and Privilege Non-Realist (P-Non-Realist). The proponents of these views would hold the following:

(i) According to the Realist, there are normative facts.

(ii) According to the P-Non-Realist, there are no normative facts, but some normative judgments still enjoy a privilege by virtue of their interpersonal appeal or acceptance.

To say that there are ‘normative facts’ will mean, for purposes here, that norms (and values) are (in some sense) objective, i.e., mind- or attitude-independent features of the world. Wilcox (1974), Schacht (1983) and Katsafanas (2013b), among many others, have defended a Realist reading, while Foot (1973) has defended a P-Non-Realist reading. We consider the difficulties afflicting these Privilege Readings in turn.

Realist readings assign a special place to power (or will to power) in explaining the objectivity of normative facts. On these views, Nietzsche holds, first, that only power really has value and, second, that power is an objective, natural property. Nietzsche’s evaluative perspective is privileged, in turn, because it involves assessing (i) prudential value (value for an agent) in terms of degree of power, and (ii) non-prudential value in terms of maximization of prudential value (i.e., maximization of power).

According to Schacht, for example, Nietzsche’s account of “the fundamental character of life and the world” as will to power is supposed to “ground” his own evaluative standpoint (1983: 348–349). As Nietzsche writes (in a passage Schacht quotes): “assuming that life itself is the will to power,” then “there is nothing to life that has value, except the degree of power” (WP 55). Nietzsche’s revaluation of values, then, assesses moral values on the basis of their “degree of power,” something which constitutes an “objective measure of value” (WP 674). Hence the privilege of his view: it embraces as an evaluative standard the only thing in life that (in fact) has value (namely power), and employs this “objective measure of value” in the revaluation (e.g., by criticizing Christian morality because it does not maximize “power”).

What exactly is Nietzsche’s argument on the N-Realist reading? Schacht writes:

Human life, for Nietzsche, is ultimately a part of a kind of vast game…[which] is, so to speak, the only game in town….The nature of the game, he holds, establishes a standard for the evaluation of everything falling within its compass. The availability of this standard places evaluation on footing that is as firm as that on which the comprehension of life and the world stands. (1983, p. 398)

Talk of “the only game in town” is far too metaphorical, however, to bear the philosophical weight demanded. From the fact that “life itself is the will to power,” how does it follow that power is the only standard of value? From the fact, for example, that all life obeys the laws of fundamental physics, nothing follows about the appropriate standard of value. What Schacht and some others seem to have in mind is something like John Stuart Mill’s argument for utilitarianism, which proceeds from the premise that since happiness is the only thing people desire or aim for, it follows that happiness is the only thing that possesses intrinsic value. This argument, though, is famously unsuccessful: from the fact that only happiness is desired, nothing at all follows about what ought to be desired. Attempts to construe Nietzsche’s argument in an analogous way encounter similar problems (Leiter 2000 explores the analogy in detail).

On Mill’s well-known and oft-criticized ‘proof’ of the principle of utility from his 1861 Utilitarianism, to show that something is visible, we must show that it is seen; and to show that something is audible, we must show that it is heard; analogously,

(P) to show that something is desirable (i.e., valuable), show that it is desired.

Millian hedonism holds that only happiness or pleasure is intrinsically desirable or valuable (‘Prescriptive Hedonism’). Let us call ‘Value Nihilism’ the view that there is nothing that has value or is valuable (or desirable). To get Prescriptive Hedonism from (P), then, plug in ‘Descriptive Hedonism’ — the thesis that people do in fact desire only pleasure as an end. If (P) is valid, Descriptive Hedonism true, and Value Nihilism false, then the truth of Prescriptive Hedonism follows. ((P), of course, is not valid, a point to which we will return.)

Notice, now, that the same type of argument seems to capture what the N-Realist construal of Nietzsche has in mind. That is, to get the N-Realist Nietzschean conclusion that what is valuable is power, take (P) and plug in a strong form of Nietzsche’s descriptive doctrine of the will to power — the doctrine, roughly, that all persons intrinsically ‘desire’ only power. If (P) is valid, Value Nihilism false, and the descriptive doctrine of the will to power is true, then the normative conclusion about power, which Schacht is after, seems to follow. (Note, of course, that the Millian Model argument as formulated so far would show only that power is what is non-morally valuable or good for an agent. Of course, if the Millian Model argument for prudential value or non-moral goodness does not work, then that provides a very strong (if defeasible) reason for supposing that there is no further argument for the related account of non-prudential value as consisting in maximization of power.)

What are the problems with this “Millian argument”? The first problem, of course, is that (P) is not valid. While from the fact that x is heard, it follows that x is audible, it does not follow from that fact that x is desired that x is desirable in the sense necessary for the argument. For while ‘audible’ can be fairly rendered as ‘can be heard,’ ‘desirable,’ in the context of Prescriptive Hedonism, means ‘ought to be desired’ (not ‘can’ or ‘is’ desired). Thus, while it follows that:

If x is heard, then x can be heard (‘is audible’),

it does not follow that,

If x is desired, then x ought to be desired (‘is desirable’).

Yet in claiming that pleasure or power are valuable, Mill and the N-Realist Nietzsche are advancing a normative thesis. The truth of this normative thesis, however, simply does not follow from the corresponding descriptive thesis.

Many, of course, have thought this too facile a response. Supplement the argument, then, by adding an ‘Internalist Constraint’ (IC), one that many philosophers have found plausible in the theory of value:

(IC) Something cannot be valuable for a person unless the person is capable of caring about (desiring) it.

The (IC) is motivated by the thought that it cannot be right to say that ‘X is valuable’ for someone when x is alien to anything a person cares about or could care about: any plausible notion of value, the (IC) supposes, must have some strong connection to a person’s existing (or potential) motivational set.

How does the (IC) help? Recall (P):

(P) To show that something is desirable (i.e., valuable) show that it is desired.

Now the (IC) puts a constraint on what things can, in fact, be desirable or valuable: namely, only those things that agents can, in fact, care about or desire. This suggests that we might reformulate (P) as follows:

(P′) To show that something is desirable (i.e., valuable), show that it is or can be desired.

(P′) now is simply a different formulation of the (IC): if we accept the (IC) then we should accept (P′). But what happens, then, if we grant the truth of Descriptive Hedonism: namely, that only pleasure is, in fact, desired. In that case, it would now follow that only pleasure is desirable (ought to be desired) (assuming, again, that Value Nihilism is false). That is, since something ought to be desired only if it can be desired (internalism), then if only x can be desired, then only x ought to be desired (assuming that Value Nihilism is false).

Will this argument rescue the N-Realist Nietzsche? Two obstacles remain. The first, and perhaps less serious one, is that we must have some reason for accepting the (IC) — or, more modestly, some reason for thinking Nietzsche accepts it. It is not clear, however, that there are adequate textual grounds for saying where Nietzsche stands on this question. Since the (IC) does, however, seem to be presupposed by the Nietzschean remarks from the Nachlass that support N-Realism — in the sense that such remarks do not constitute a good argument without the (IC) — let us grant that Nietzsche accepts the (IC), and let us simply put aside the contentious issue of whether we ought to accept the (IC) as a general philosophical matter.

A second difficulty will still remain: namely, that the argument for N-Realism still depends on the truth of the relevant descriptive thesis, in Nietzsche’s case, the doctrine of the will to power. This presents two problems. First, in the works Nietzsche chose to publish, it seems clear that he did not, in fact, accept the doctrine in the strong form required for the N-Realist argument (namely, that it is only power that persons ever aim for or desire). Second, it is simply not a plausible doctrine in its strong form.

For the Millian Model argument for N-Realism to work in its new form (that is, supplemented with the (IC)) it must be the case that that which ought to be desired (‘is valuable’) are the only things that are, in fact, desired. Since the N-Realist Nietzschean conclusion is that only power is valuable, power must be the only thing that is, in fact, desired (assuming, again, that something is valuable, i.e., that Value Nihilism is false). Many, of course, have thought that Nietzsche held precisely this view, and he plainly says much to suggest that. Zarathustra states that, “Where I found the living, there I found will to power” (Z II:12); Nietzsche refers to “the will to power which is the will of life” (GS 349); he says “the really fundamental instinct of life…aims at the expansion of power” (GS 349); “life simply is will to power,” meaning a striving “to grow, spread, seize, become predominant” (BGE 259); he refers to his “theory that in all events a will to power is operating” (GM II:12); he claims that “[a] living thing seeks above all to discharge its strength — life itself is will to power” (BGE 13); and so on.

The difficulty is that Nietzsche says other things which might suggest that the stronger remarks are misleading; for example:

Life itself is to my mind the instinct for growth, for durability, for an accumulation of forces, for power: where the will to power is lacking there is decline. It is my contention that all the supreme values of mankind lack this will…. (A 6)

But if all actions manifested this will, then this will could never be found lacking. Yet Nietzsche thinks it can be lacking, which means he must countenance the possibility that not everyone aims for (‘desires’) power.

This passage is not atypical. Later in the same work, he returns to the same theme concerning “[w]herever the will to power declines in any form” (A 17). In the immediately preceding work he claims that the “effects” of liberal institutions are “known well enough: they undermine the will to power” (TI IX:38). And in the immediately subsequent work (his last), Nietzsche refers to “the terrible aspects of reality (in affects, in desires, in the will to power)…” (EH IV:4), which certainly sounds as if will to power is simply one among various characteristics of reality — alongside affects and desires, rather than the essential core of them all.

Three other general textual considerations count against attributing the strong doctrine of the will to power to Nietzsche. First, if, as the defenders of the strong doctrine believe, “his fundamental principle is the ‘will to power’”, then it is hard to understand why he says almost nothing about will to power — and nothing at all to suggest it is his “fundamental principle” — in the two major self-reflective moments in the Nietzschean corpus: his last major work, Ecce Homo, where he reviews and assesses his life and writings, including specifically all his prior books (EH III); and the series of new prefaces he wrote for The Birth of Tragedy, Human, All Too Human, Dawn, and The Gay Science in 1886, in which he revisits his major themes. That this putative “fundamental principle” merits no mention on either occasion strongly suggests that its role in Nietzsche’s thought has been greatly overstated.

Second, the view at issue presupposes an unusually strong doctrine of the will to power: a doctrine, to the effect, that all life (actions, events) reflects the will to power. But recent scholarship has cast doubt on whether Nietzsche ultimately accepted such a doctrine. The single most famous passage on will to power in the Nietzschean corpus, for example, is the concluding section (1067) of The Will to Power, where he affirms that, “This world is the will to power — and nothing besides! And you yourselves are also this will to power — and nothing besides!” Although a favorite of commentators for many years, the passage has now been conclusively discredited by the leading scholar of the Nachlass, the late Mazzino Montinari. Montinari has shown that Nietzsche had, in fact, discarded the passage by the spring of 1887 (1982: 103–104)! It was, as Montinari notes, made part of the Köselitz-Forster compilation of The Will to Power (the basis for the English-language edition by Kaufmann and Hollingdale) notwithstanding “Nietzsche’s literary intentions” (1982: 104).

Finally, Maudemarie Clark has argued that Nietzsche could not have accepted the very strongest form of the doctrine of the will to power — namely, that all force, animate and inanimate, is will to power — given the putative argument he gives for it. Clark points out that the only argument for this doctrine of the will to power in Nietzsche’s published works — in Section 36 of Beyond Good and Evil — is cast in the conditional form: if we accept certain initial hypotheses, then, Nietzsche thinks, the strong doctrine of the will to power follows. But one of the antecedents of this conditional is the “causality of the will,” and Clark argues that Nietzsche clearly rejects such causality elsewhere in his work (e.g., GS 127, TI II:5, TI VI:3). Therefore, this section cannot constitute an argument for the strongest doctrine of the will to power that Nietzsche, himself, would actually accept! Rather than embracing the strongest form of the doctrine, Clark argues that Nietzsche is, somewhat ironically, illustrating the very flaw of philosophers he warns against in the surrounding passages: namely, their tendency to propound theories of the essence of reality that are just projections of their own evaluative commitments (Clark 1990, pp. 212–227). Thus, Nietzsche says of the Stoic talk of living “according to nature” that “while you pretend rapturously to read the canon of your law in nature, you want something opposite….Your pride wants to impose your morality, your ideal, on nature…” (BGE 9). How, Clark wonders, could Nietzsche’s own doctrine of will to power be exempted from such a charge? (Note, too, that Montinari claims that the one surviving relic of 1067 of The Will to Power in the published works is precisely the ironic Section 36 of Beyond Good and Evil (1982: 104).)

What, then, does Nietzsche believe about will to power? There are, to be sure, competing views in the secondary literature. Reginster 2006 treats will to power as a will to overcome resistances; Richardson 1996 treats will to power as the tendency of every drive to redirect every other drive towards its own ends. As others have noted (e.g., Clark 1990: 209–212), Nietzsche’s doctrine of will to power, in its original deployment and most of its later occurrences in the published work, is psychological in character: the will to power is posited as the best psychological explanation for a wide variety of human behaviors. Here Richardson’s account seems to fare somewhat better than Reginster’s. (Katsafanas 2013b follows Reginster, and tries to develop a “constitutivist” account of objective value based on the idea that all actions aim to overcome resistances; Huddleston 2017 offers a trenchant critique of the plausibility of such a view.) Yet Richardson’s account has difficulty with some of Nietzsche’s claims, as when he says that “every animal…instinctively strives for optimal conditions under which it can…attain its maximum in the feeling of power” (GM III:7), which seems to propose desire for power as a competitor with psychological hedonism. But a universal desire for either pleasure or power feelings is not especially plausible, even if both motives are important ones. Indeed, as the preceding passages and considerations make clear, Nietzsche could not have believed that will to power was the exclusive explanation for all human behavior. To the extent he sometimes seems to embrace this stronger claim (see the example, above), we must simply take Nietzsche to have overstated his case — something which his penchant for hyperbolic rhetoric and polemics often leads him to do — or to be engaged in the kind of ironic move described by Clark, above. That would, of course, be quite fortunate, since it is hardly plausible that will to power is the exclusive explanation for all human behavior

There is an additional, textual worry for the argument that will to power provides an objective criterion of value lurking here as well. Nietzsche only makes the remarks that seem to suggest that power is an objective criterion in passages from the Nachlass, work that Nietzsche never published during his lifetime. Thus, even if one thought that Nietzsche really held the strong descriptive doctrine of the will to power — the doctrine that all animate force (perhaps all force) is will to power — in his published works, it is still the case that he only uses this doctrine to argue for the normative conclusion in Nachlass material. Since scholars have now raised important doubts about the canonical status of this Nachlass material (Montinari 1982: 92–104; Hollingdale 1985: 166–172, 182–186), this might suggest that a view ought not to be attributed to Nietzsche solely on the basis of its articulation in these notebooks, which is exactly what the N-Realist reading requires. (For more recent debate about the relevance of the Nachlass material to understanding will to power, see Katsafanas 2013b: 248–250 and Leiter 2019a: 60–62.)

Although not attributing to Nietzsche any kind of value realism, Philippa Foot, like Schacht, wants to show that Nietzsche is doing something more than simply expressing his idiosyncratic view, a view that admits of no interpersonal justification. While agreeing that Nietzsche’s intention is, in part, “to present us with a clash of interests — the good of the strong against that of the weak,” Foot adds that “this is not all he wants to suggest” (1973: 162). Noting that Nietzsche “seems to want to say that anyone who is strong, independent, and so on — anyone who fits his description of the higher type of man — is one who has value in himself” (163), Foot goes on to explicate this notion of “value” as follows:

[I]t does make sense to say that we value strong and exceptional individuals…. We do find patterns of reaction to exceptional men that would allow us to see here a valuing rather similar to valuing on aesthetic grounds…. I am thinking of the interest and admiration which is the common attitude to remarkable men of exceptional independence of mind and strength of will…. [Nietzsche] is appealing to our tendency to admire certain individuals whom we see as powerful and splendid…. [There is] a similarity between the way we attribute value (aesthetic value) to art objects and the value that Nietzsche attributes to a certain kind of man, both resting on a set of common reactions…. (1973: 163)

So Nietzsche, on this account, does not claim that his evaluative perspective is veridical; he simply claims that it enjoys a certain sort of interpersonal appeal, owing to our “common attitude to remarkable men,” “our tendency to admire certain individuals,” to find them aesthetically appealing. There may be no fact-of-the-matter as to whether higher men are or are not really valuable, but Nietzsche’s evaluative standpoint is privileged by virtue of its appeal to all of us. We’re all interested, it seems, in the flourishing of higher men.

Yet Nietzsche could not embrace the view that the flourishing of “higher men” will appeal to “our tendency” to admire such men or to any sort of “common” attitude, given the logic of his critique of morality. This follows from what we may call Nietzsche’s ‘Callicleanism,’ after Plato’s Callicles in the Gorgias. It has now become something of a commonplace for commentators to note that Nietzsche did not accept one sort of Calliclean view, namely, the view that “anyone who is to live aright should suffer his appetites to grow to the greatest extent and not check them” (Gorgias, 419e) (cf. Nehamas 1985: 202–203; BGE 188). Yet there remains a more important respect in which Nietzsche’s view is Calliclean: namely, in its embrace of the Calliclean doctrine that the inferior employ morality to make “slaves of those who are naturally better” (Gorgias, 491e-492a), that the weaker folk, the majority…frame the laws [and, we might add, the morals] for their own advantage’ in order to ‘frighten [the strong] by saying that to overreach others is shameful and evil’ (Gorgias, 483b-d). In short, Callicles’ view is that morality is simply the prudence of the weak, who unable to do what the strong can do, opt instead to put the actions of the strong under the ban of morality. This, of course, is essentially Nietzsche’s view as well. So, for example, Nietzsche describes slave morality as simply ‘the prudence [Klugheit] of the lowest order’ (GM I:13), and he observes that “everything that elevates an individual above the herd and intimidates the neighbor is…called evil” (BGE 201), that “[m]oral judgments and condemnations constitute the favorite revenge of the spiritually limited against those less limited” (BGE 219), and he claims that the “chief means” by which the “weak and mediocre…weaken and pull down the stronger” is “the moral judgment” (WP 345).

Recall, now, that Foot wanted to resist the view that in his revaluation Nietzsche simply “present[s] us with a clash of interests — the good of the strong against that of the weak” (1973: 162); instead, Foot suggests that Nietzsche is appealing to a ‘common’ tendency to admire higher men, men who would otherwise be thwarted by the reign of moral values. But for a Calliclean like Nietzsche, it is part of the very appeal of morality that it does thwart the flourishing of higher men. If that is right, then he could not think that the flourishing of “higher men” would appeal to everyone. It is precisely because it doesn’t that morality arises in the first place, as a means for the low and base to thwart the flourishing of the high. This is not to deny that higher men may still be admirable in the eyes of the base and low (hence their envy); it is to deny, however, that Nietzsche’s evaluative perspective — that it is an objection to morality that it thwarts the high — could enjoy a privilege in virtue of this shared admiration. On the Calliclean picture, there is a fundamental hostility between the high and low, the strong and the weak, one which will not be bridged by inviting the low to admire the high, or the weak, the strong. “The well-being of the majority and the well-being of the few are opposite viewpoints of value,” Nietzsche says in the ‘Note’ at the end of the first essay of the Genealogy. And in Nietzsche’s revaluation, it appears, there is no evaluative standpoint from which one could successfully mediate and reconcile the normative claims of the opposing moralities.

3.2 Nietzsche’s Anti-Realism

If Nietzsche is not a realist about value, then he must be an anti-realist: he must deny that there is any objective fact of the matter that would privilege his evaluative perspective over its target. (This, in fact, is the most familiar reading outside the secondary literature on Nietzsche; one finds this view of Nietzsche’s metaethics, for example, in the sociologist Max Weber and the moral philosopher Alasdair MacIntyre, among many others.) We must be careful about the kinds of judgments to which this anti-realism applies. Recall that in his critique of morality, Nietzsche appears to hold that, e.g., “herd” morality is good for the herd, but that it is bad for higher men. He says, for example, that, “The ideas of the herd should rule in the herd — but not reach out beyond it” (WP 287; emphasis added); and elsewhere he describes slave morality as simply “the prudence of the lowest order” (GM I:13). It may appear that regarding value judgments pertaining to welfare or prudential goodness — what is good or bad for particular sorts of persons — Nietzsche believes there is an objective fact of the matter, though one relative to type-facts about persons. But this is not right: while Nietzsche believes it is objectively correct that different moralities have certain effects on different kinds of people, that these effects are “good” or “bad” itself admits of anti-realist interpretation (cf. Leiter 2015: 119). Even more importantly, though, Nietzsche’s anti-realism applies to the “revaluative” judgment that follows upon these judgments about the effects of different moralities: that is, the judgment that because herd morality is good for the herd but bad for higher men, herd morality (or the universal reign of herd morality) is bad or disvaluable.

Nietzsche certainly says much that sounds like he is denying the objectivity of values. Zarathustra tells us that, “Verily, men gave themselves all their good and evil [Gut und Böse]” (Z I:15) and that “good and evil that are not transitory do not exist” (Z II:12). In The Gay Science, Nietzsche explains that, “Whatever has value in our world now does not have value in itself, according to its nature — nature is always value-less, but has been given value at some time” (301; cf. D 3). Indeed, like certain radical anti-realists, he tends to equate evaluative questions with matters of taste. “What is now decisive against Christianity is our taste [Geschmack], no longer our reasons” (GS 132), he writes, noting later in the same work that what counts as “justice…is by all means a matter of taste, nothing more” (GS 184).

Nietzsche’s primary argument for anti-realism about value is explanatory: moral facts don’t figure in the “best explanation” of experience, and so are not real constituents of the objective world (Leiter 2019a: 17–48). Moral values, in short, can be “explained away.” Such a conclusion follows from Nietzsche’s naturalism (on the latter, see the competing accounts in Janaway 2007 and Leiter 2013). As we saw in the context of Nietzsche’s critique of morality, Nietzsche thinks a person’s moral beliefs can be explained in naturalistic terms, i.e., in terms of type-facts about that person. Thus, to explain a person’s moral judgments, one needn’t appeal to the existence of objective moral facts: psycho-physical facts about the person suffice. Thus, since non-evaluative type-facts are the primary explanatory facts, and since explanatory power is the mark of objective facts, it appears that there cannot be any value facts. Moral judgments and evaluations are “images” and “fantasies,” says Nietzsche, the mere effects of type-facts about agents (D 119).

To describe Nietzsche as a moral anti-realist is so far only to ascribe to him a metaphysical view: namely, that there are no objective facts about what is morally right and wrong. It is a somewhat vexed interpretive question whether we should also ascribe to Nietzsche a particular view about the semantics of moral judgment, a topic about which no philosopher prior to the 20^th century had a worked–out view (see again Hussain 2013). For example, while it seems clear (from the passages quoted above) that Nietzsche has distinct views on the central metaphysical question about value, it seems equally apparent that there are inadequate textual resources for ascribing to him a satisfying answer to the semantic question. Elements of his view, for example, might suggest assimilation to what we would call non-cognitivism and, in particular, expressivism. For example, in describing master and Christian morality as “opposite forms in the optics of value [Werthe],” Nietzsche goes on to assert that, as opposite “optical” forms, they “are…immune to reasons and refutations. One cannot refute Christianity; one cannot refute a disease of the eye…. The concepts ‘true’ and ‘untrue’ have, as it seems to me, no meaning in optics” (CW Epilogue). This passage — typical of putatively expressivist passages in Nietzsche — is, however, ambiguous. For the passage could mean that “true” and “false” are meaningless not because evaluative judgments are essentially non-cognitive, but rather because competing evaluative views are immune to the effects of reasoning. There may be rational grounds for thinking one view better than another, perhaps for thinking one true and the other false, but since reasoning has so little impact in this context, it is “meaningless” (in the sense of pointless) to raise issues of truth and falsity.

More recently, Hussain (2007) has argued that we read Nietzsche as a fictionalist about moral value: granted that Nietzsche is an anti-realist about value (there exists no objective fact about what has value in-itself), Hussain wonders what it is those who “create values” can understand themselves to have done? Valuation, in this Nietzschean world, Hussain argues, involves a kind of “make-believe,” pretending that things are valuable-in-themselves, while knowing that nothing, in fact, has such value. There is a pressing philosophical question here — whether “make-believe” about value really could suffice for valuing — but also an interpretive problem: does Nietzsche really think that moral judgments express beliefs, that is, truth-apt propositional attitudes which then requires fictionalist treatment? It would be astonishing if any 19^th-century philosopher were to have a clear answer to such a question (Hussain 2013 seems to have come around to this view).

While Nietzsche was, to be sure, among the first to recognize the extent to which linguistic and grammatical practices generate metaphysical assumptions and problems, he simply did not view metaphysical questions themselves as best framed as issues about the semantics of a given region of discourse (e.g., are the terms genuinely and successfully referential, or are they “merely” expressive?). It is doubtful, then, that there are adequate grounds for assigning Nietzsche a view on such subtle matters as whether ethical language is primarily cognitive or non-cognitive, when it clearly evinces aspects of both descriptive and prescriptive discourse.

Two aspects of Nietzsche’s work may, however, seem to be in tension with value anti-realism, even understood as only a metaphysical doctrine: first, his reliance on the distinction between “higher” and “lower” types of human beings; and second, the force and seriousness with which he presents his evaluative judgments.

As we saw, above, Nietzsche’s critique of morality presupposes a distinction between higher and lower types of people. But are there objective facts about who is “high” and who is “low”? And if so, would such a view be compatible with anti-realism?

Suppose there are objective facts about “high” and “low”: Goethe really is a higher type, and the herd animal really is a lower type. But there is still no objective fact about whether MPS is non-prudentially disvaluable just because it has the effect of thwarting the flourishing of objectively higher types. Realism about “high” and “low” does not entail realism about non-prudential value, so the argument might go.

Such a response cannot work for two reasons. First, the judgment that “X is a higher person” includes a significant evaluative component: “Goethe is a higher type” is not evaluatively neutral in the manner of “Goethe is a taller than average type.” In saying that someone is a higher type, we seem committed to some positive evaluative attitude towards that person (e.g., that it is good to have persons like that around). If there is an objective fact that “X is a higher type,” and it is a fact that MPS thwarts the flourishing of higher types, then it would seem that at least some objective weight must accrue to the Nietzschean position that MPS is disvaluable because of this effect it has.

Second, if it is an objective fact that Goethe is a higher type and, say, Hitler is a herd animal, then the following counterfactual would seem to be true:

(C) If Hitler had been like Goethe, he would have been better off.

He would have been better off because he would have been a higher type, instead of a lower type — and it is an objective fact that the high are really high, and the low are really low. But this seemingly objective judgment — that Hitler would have been better off had he been more like Goethe — is a non-prudential value judgment; it is not a judgment about what is good for Hitler under the circumstances, but rather a judgment about what would make Hitler better off, but for his circumstances. In general, it seems that conceding the objectivity of “high” and “low” permits one to make objective non-prudential value judgments like: the good of the higher type is superior to the good of the lower type.

For these reasons, if Nietzsche is an anti-realist about non-prudential moral value, then he must also be an anti-realist about judgments of “high” and “low,” It may be an objective fact that MPS thwarts the flourishing of those Nietzsche regards as higher types; but it is not an objective fact that they are really higher.

In fact, there is textual evidence that this is exactly Nietzsche’s view. For example, in Thus Spoke Zarathustra, Nietzsche writes that, “Good and evil, and rich and poor, and high and low [Hoch und Gering], and all the names of values — arms shall they be and clattering signs that life must overcome itself again and again” (Z II:7). Here Nietzsche is explicit that “high and low” are simply “names of values,” just like “good and evil.” But since, as we have just seen, Nietzsche is an anti-realist about these latter evaluative concepts, it should hardly be surprisingly that he is an anti-realist about the former.

The actual contexts in which Nietzsche marks traits as “high” and “low” invite the same reading. Consider, for example, the exposition in the Genealogy (I:14) of the sense in which slave morality is the “prudence of the lowest order” (GM, I:13). According to Nietzsche, slave morality takes certain typical characteristics of the “lowest order” and redescribes them in morally praiseworthy lights. So, for example, their impotence becomes “goodness of heart,” their anxious lowliness becomes “humility,” their “inoffensiveness” and “lingering at the door” becomes “patience”, and their desire for retaliation becomes a desire for justice. If Nietzsche were really a realist about the concept of “lowness”, then we ought to be able to identify the objective facts in virtue of which something is really low. Yet when Nietzsche tries to describe all patience as nothing more than a “lingering at the door” and all humility as simply “anxious lowliness,” it is natural to think that there is no “objective” fact about “lowness” here but simply a polemical and evaluatively loaded characterization. To think that all humility is really “anxious lowliness” is just to identify oneself as one who shares Nietzsche’s evaluative sensibility, one “whose ears are related to ours” (GS 381), one “predisposed and predestined” for Nietzsche’s insights (BGE 30). In short, given the way in which Nietzsche actually speaks of the “high” and “low,” we should understand Nietzsche’s metaethical position as also characterizing these terms: to say that “X is low” is not to describe an objective fact, but rather to identify oneself as sharing in a certain evaluative sensibility or taste.

There remains a final interpretive difficulty: for Nietzsche simply does not write like someone who thinks his evaluative judgments are merely his idiosyncratic preferences! On the metaethical position elaborated here, it seems Nietzsche must believe that if, in response to his point that “morality were to blame if the highest power and splendor actually possible to the type man was never in fact attained” (GM Pref:6), someone were to say, “So much the better for morality!”, there would be nothing further to say to that person: at the best, Nietzsche might turn his back and say, “Oh well — doesn’t share my evaluative tastes.” Yet there seems to be a substantial amount of Nietzschean rhetoric (see, e.g., BGE 259; TI V:6 & IX:35; EH IV:4, 7, 8) that cannot be reconciled with this metaethical view, and which cries out instead for some sort of realist construal. Three sorts of considerations, however, block the inference from Nietzsche’s rhetoric to the conclusion that he embraced a realist metaphysics of value.

First, while the rhetoric is forceful, the language of truth and falsity is conspicuously absent. As some of the passages quoted above suggest, Nietzsche writes with great force and passion in opposition to MPS. But it is striking that he does not use the epistemic value terms — the language of truth and falsity, real and unreal — in this context. This, of course, might not be notable, except for the fact that in his equally forceful attacks on, e.g., Christian cosmology, or religious interpretations of natural events, he invokes the conceptual apparatus of truth and falsity, truth and lie, reality and appearance, all the time (cf. Leiter 2015: 125). Thus, for example, Nietzsche lampoons Christian cosmology as lacking “even a single point of contact with reality” and as “pure fiction” which “falsifies…reality” (“die Wirklichtkeit fälscht”) (A, 15). Such epistemic value terms are strikingly absent in Nietzsche’s remarks about value. One natural explanation for this difference in rhetoric — natural especially in light of the substantial evidence for his anti-realism — is precisely that in the moral case he does not think there is any fact of the matter.

Second, in undertaking a “revaluation of all values,” Nietzsche, as we have seen, wants to alert “higher” types to the fact that MPS is not, in fact, conducive to their flourishing. Thus, he needs to “wake up” his appropriate readers — those whose “ears are related” to his — to the dangers of MPS, a task made all the more difficult by MPS’s pretension to be “morality itself.” Given, then, that Nietzsche’s target is a certain sort of misunderstanding on the part of higher men, and given the difficulty of supplanting the norms that figure in this misunderstanding (the norms of MPS), it should be unsurprising that Nietzsche writes with passion and force: he must shake higher types out of their intuitive commitment to the moral traditions of two millennia! Moreover, Nietzsche’s naturalism, and the prominent role it assigns to non-conscious drives and type-facts, leads him to be skeptical about the efficacy of reasons and arguments. But a skeptic about the efficacy of rational persuasion might very well opt for persuasion through other rhetorical devices.

Third, and perhaps most importantly, a rhetorical tone like Nietzsche’s — looked at in the context of his life — does not really suggest realism about the content, but rather desperation on the part of the author to reach an increasingly distant and uninterested audience. The Nietzsche who was almost completely ignored during the years before illness erased his intellect and deprived him of his sanity might have resorted to more and more strident and violent rhetoric in frustration over not being heard — and not because he was a realist. Indeed, in the absence of explicit evidence of value realism, this seems the most plausible explanation for the vast majority of the passages with which we have been concerned in this section.

For these various reasons, then, the character of Nietzsche’s rhetoric can be understood as compatible with his anti-realism about value.

3.3 Nietzsche’s Sentimentalism

Nietzsche is part of a tradition of moral anti-realists (and moral relativists) who are also sentimentalists, like Hume and, in the German tradition, Herder (see Forster 2017)—that is, philosophers who think the best explanation of our moral judgments is in terms of our emotional or affective responses to states of affairs in the world, responses that are, for Hume and Nietzsche, explicable in terms of psychological facts about the judger. Of course, if our emotional responses had cognitive content—if they were, in fact, epistemically sensitive to the putatively moral features of the world—then sentimentalism would be compatible with moral realism (more precisely, with knowledge of objective moral facts). That does not, however, appear to be Nietzsche’s view: “there is nothing good, nothing beautiful, nothing sublime, nothing evil in itself, but that there are states of the soul in which we impose such words upon things external to and within us” (D 210). (For a contrary view of Nietzsche’s treatment of emotions, see Poellner 2012, Mitchell 2020; for doubts, see Leiter 2019a: 71 n. 9.)

Moral judgments, on Nietzsche’s view, arise from the interaction of two kinds of affective responses: first, a “basic affect” of inclination towards or aversion from certain acts (or states of affairs), and then a further affective response (the “meta-affect”) to that basic affect (that is, sometimes we can be either inclined towards or averted from our basic affects). Affects, for Nietzsche, are essentially conative, constituting motivations and influencing actions (and judgments). (In this regard, Nietzsche does not have a general account of the emotions, since he is only interested in the conative affects.) Basic affects, for Nietzsche, are non-cognitive, that is, identifiable solely by how they feel to the subject who experiences the affect. By contrast, meta-affects (e.g., guilt) may incorporate a cognitive component like belief. (For a more detailed treatment, see Leiter 2019a: 67–83, and also Fowles 2020.)

Thus, in Daybreak, Nietzsche’s first mature work, “moral feelings” (Moralische Gefühle) are said to be inculcated when “children observe in adults inclinations for and aversions to certain actions and, as born apes, imitate these inclinations [Neigungen] and aversions [Abneigungen]; in later life they find themselves full of these acquired and well-exercised affects [Affekten] and consider it only decent to try to account for and justify them” (D 34). Moral feelings or affects, in the passage under consideration, are equated with “inclinations for and aversions to certain actions,” or, more precisely, with the mental state, whatever it is, that motivates one to perform certain actions or avoid certain other actions, a role often assigned to feelings. Feelings have another important characteristic: namely, that they are phenomenologically distinctive, there is something they feel like.

In addition to feelings and affects, the mind for Nietzsche also includes drives, which we may understand (following Katsafanas 2013) as dispositions to have particular affective responses under certain circumstances (cf. Richardson, 2004, pp. 34–39, for a related account). Thus, for example, the sex drive would be a disposition to become sexually aroused, perhaps (though not necessarily) in the presence of an attractive member of the opposite or same sex. These affective orientations also structure how the world appears to us evaluatively: they influence, for example, “perceptual salience,” the features of a situation that come to the fore for the agent (because the drive focuses attention on them) (cf. D 119).

The relationship between drives and affects is usefully illustrated by this 1881 passage:

The same drive evolves into the painful feeling of cowardice under the impress of the reproach custom has imposed upon this drive; or into the pleasant feeling of humility if it happens that a custom such as the Christian has taken it to its heart and called it good. That is to say, it is attended by either a good or a bad conscience! In it itself it has, like every drive, neither this moral character nor any moral character at all, nor even a definite attendant sensation of pleasure or displeasure: it acquires all this, as its second nature, only when it enters into relations with drives already baptized good or evil or is noted as a quality of beings the people has already evaluated and determined in a moral sense…. (D 38)

Here the same drive is said to have the potential to give rise to two different moral feelings, that of cowardice (which has an unpleasant valence) or humility (a pleasant valence), depending on the cultural context. The drive in question must be something like, a disposition to avoid offending dangerous enemies, which, if experienced by a Homeric Greek would then give rise to feelings of self-contempt for being a coward and, if experienced by a Christian, would be experienced as the admirable virtue of humility. Cultures, partly through the mechanisms of parental inculcation already noted (as well as concurrent social pressures), teach individuals to have particular affective responses to the very same drive. Here we now see the two layers of affects: first, there is the affect of aversion towards offending dangerous enemies which is produced by the drive itself, but then there is the distinctively moral affect of feeling ashamed (as the Homeric Greek does) or proud (as the Christian does) of that affective response. The moral affect, then, is more complicated than what I have so far called “the basic affect” of inclination or aversion. The feeling of being a coward, on this account, represents the combination of a feeling of aversion towards offending a dangerous enemy, conjoined with a meta-feeling of contempt or disgust for having that original feeling. The meta-feeling is, at bottom, a feeling of aversion away from the basic affect, though perhaps to individuate it correctly we will need to add some kind of belief about why that basic feeling of aversion is contemptible: e.g., the belief that Homeric men slay their offending enemies, rather than cower before them. Perhaps this is also what Nietzsche is getting at when he writes: “[B]ehind feelings there stand judgments [Urtheile] and evaluations [Werthschätzungen] which we inherit in the form of feelings (inclinations, aversions). The inspiration born of a feeling is the grandchild of a judgment—and often of a false judgment!” (D 35).

So, for example, the Christian judges that a good person chooses to display humility, a trait admirable in the eyes of God, and thus when the Christian experiences the basic affect of aversion towards offending a dangerous enemy, he then experiences the meta-affect of a positive inclination or valence towards that basic affect: he is proud of his humility. The Christian then inculcates those same affective responses in his children, so that their feelings of inclination and aversion are traceable back to a false judgment, i.e., the judgment that there is a God who thinks humility a virtuous trait, as well as the false belief that the “humility” of the Christian is a free choice, rather than a reaction he cannot avoid having (cf. GM I:13). As Nietzsche observes, “we are all irrational” in that we “still draw the conclusions of judgments we consider false, of teachings in which we no longer believe—our feelings make us do it” (D 99).

4. Nietzsche’s Lack of a Political Philosophy

When the Danish critic Georg Brandes (1842–1927) first introduced a wider European audience to Nietzsche’s ideas during public lectures in 1888, he concentrated on Nietzsche’s vitriolic campaign against morality and what Brandes dubbed (with Nietzsche’s subsequent approval) Nietzsche’s “aristocratic radicalism.” On this reading, Nietzsche was primarily concerned with questions of value and culture (especially the value of morality and its effect on culture), and his philosophical standpoint was acknowledged to be a deeply illiberal one: what matters are great human beings, not the “herd.” The egalitarian premise of all contemporary moral and political theory — the premise, in one form or another, of the equal worth or dignity of each person — is simply absent in Nietzsche’s work (Leiter 2019b connects this anti-egalitarianism to Nietzsche’s famous idea that God is dead). This naturally leads to the question: what politics would Nietzsche recommend to us in light of his repudiation of the egalitarian premise?

A striking feature of the reception of Nietzsche in the last half-century is the large literature that has developed on Nietzsche’s purported political philosophy. Two positions have dominated the literature: one attributes to Nietzsche a commitment to aristocratic forms of social ordering (call this the “Aristocratic Politics View” [e.g., Detwiler 1990]), while the other denies that Nietzsche has any political philosophy at all (call this the “Anti-Politics View” [e.g., Hunt 1985]).

Even the casual reader knows, of course, that Nietzsche has intense opinions about everything, from German cuisine to the unparalleled brilliance (in Nietzsche’s estimation) of Bizet’s operas, not to mention various and sundry “political” matters. The interpretive question, however, is whether scattered remarks and parenthetical outbursts add up to systematic views on questions of philosophical significance about politics.

Is Nietzsche even interested in political philosophy? Nussbaum (1997: 1) asserts that, “Nietzsche claimed to be a political thinker, indeed an important political thinker”, but she can produce no clear textual evidence in support of that contention. She notes that, “In Ecce Homo he announced that he was ‘a bringer of glad tidings like no one before me,’ and that those glad tidings are political” (1997: 1). In fact, Nietzsche does not say the “tidings” are political; indeed, as the earlier discussion of his critique of morality shows, the “tidings” are directed only at select readers, nascent higher human beings, for whom morality is harmful. That this section from Ecce Homo (IV:1) concludes with the hyperbolic claim that only with Nietzsche does “the earth [first] know[ ] great politics” does as little to establish that he has a political philosophy as the claim, in the very same passage, that Nietzsche’s “glad tidings” will cause “upheavals, a convulsion of earthquakes, a moving of mountains and valleys” does to establish that he has a geological theory. Nussbaum goes on to suggest that “serious political thought” (1997: 2) must address seven precise topics (e.g., “procedural justification” [“procedures…that legitimate and/or justify the resulting proposals” for “political structure”], “gender and the family,” and “justice between nations”) — most of which, of course, Nietzsche does not address. (Marx does not address most of them either.) Instead of drawing the natural conclusion — Nietzsche was not interested in questions of political philosophy — she, surprisingly, decries his “baneful influence” in political philosophy (1997: 12), although one cannot doubt his baneful influence in real-world politics.

Those who claim to find a political philosophy in Nietzsche typically rely on a handful of passages — most often, sections 56–57 of The Antichrist, but also section BGE 257 on “slavery” — as the slender evidence on the basis of which elaborate views about the ideal forms of social and political organization are attributed to Nietzsche. In particular, Nietzsche is said to endorse (in A 56–57) the caste-based society associated with the Hindu Laws of Manu as his political ideal:

The order of castes, the supreme, the dominant law, is merely the sanction of a natural order, a natural lawfulness of the first rank, over which no arbitrariness, no “modern idea” has any power…Nature, not Manu, distinguishes the pre-eminently spiritual ones, those who are pre-eminently strong in muscle and temperament, and those, the third type, who excel neither in one respect nor in the other, the mediocre ones — the last as the great majority, the first as the elite. (A 57)

This reading, however, does not withstand scrutiny, as Thomas Brobjer (1998) has argued. As Brobjer notes, the only other published discussion of the laws of Manu, in Twilight of the Idols, is highly critical, not laudatory (pp. 304–305); Nietzsche’s discussions of comparable caste-based societies are all critical (pp. 308–309); and Nietzsche’s unpublished notebooks contain numerous entries on the theme “a critique of the Laws of Manu” (pp. 310–312). The passage from The Antichrist only seems laudatory when read out of context; as Brobjer remarks:

[Nietzsche’s] purpose [in these passages in The Antichrist] is to make the contrast with Christianity as strong as possible, to provoke the reader, to make the reader “realize” that even the laws of Manu… is higher and more humane than Christianity. Whereas Christianity destroys, the intention at least of the laws of Manu was to save and protect. (1998: 312–313)

In other words, the rhetorical context of the passage is crucial, though it is typically ignored by commentators defending the Aristocratic Politics View. Indeed, the passage quoted above from A 57 is specifically introduced to illustrate the use of the “holy lie” (the lie being, in this case, the claim that “nature, not Manu” distinguishes the castes). And as even the title of the book would suggest, Nietzsche’s target is Christianity, and the laws of Manu are invoked simply to drive home that point. Thus, although Manu and Christianity both depend on lies, at least the Manu lies, according to Nietzsche, are not put in the service of Christian ends, i.e., “poisoning, slander, negation of life, contempt for the body, the degradation and self-violation of man through the concept of sin” (A 56). Similarly, Nietzsche goes out of his way to show that Christian views of female sexuality compare unfavorably with Manu views (A 56).

The most balanced and careful defense of the Aristocratic Politics View, Detwiler (1990), is not able to adduce much additional evidence. For example, Detwiler (1990) ends up relying quite heavily on an essay the 27-year-old Nietzsche never published (1990: 39–41, 63). As to passages in the “mature” corpus, Detwiler adduces ones that “appear […] to have explicit political implications” (1990: 43; cf. 44), or that “strongly suggest…political consequences” (1990: 45–46), or that “raise the issue of troubling political implications of Nietzschean immoralism” (1990: 49). But “implications” and “consequences” are one thing, and having a political philosophy is another. (See in this regard the discussion of BGE 257 in Huddleston 2019: 113 n. 39). The canon of political philosophers is composed of thinkers (like Hobbes, Locke, Rousseau, and Mill) who have philosophical views about political questions — the justification of state power, the liberty of the individual, political legitimacy, etc. — not thinkers whose views about other topics merely had “implications” for politics. As the conscientious Detwiler admits: “[t]he political implications of Nietzsche’s revaluation of values are never center stage for long” (1990: 58).

Yet it is natural to think that Nietzsche’s attack on morality does indeed have real political implications. When Nietzsche commends the laws of Manu for “mak[ing] possible the higher and the highest types” (A 57), this resonates, all too obviously, with Nietzsche’s central concern that morality is harmful to the highest types of human beings. Yet the undeniable “resonance” fails to show that Nietzsche endorses the laws of Manu. Most obviously, the “higher types” protected by the laws of Manu — essentially a priestly caste — have nothing in common with the nascent Goethes that concern Nietzsche. Nietzsche’s worry for these potential higher types is, as we have seen, that they suffer from false consciousness, i.e., the false belief that “morality in the pejorative sense,” i.e., MPS, is good for them. MPS is a threat to the flourishing of nascent Goethes, and it is this flourishing that interests Nietzsche above all. It would suffice for Nietzsche’s purposes that nascent Goethes give up their faith in MPS — in other words, it is individual attitudes not political structures that are Nietzsche’s primary object (“The ideas of the herd should rule in the herd,” says Nietzsche, “and not reach out beyond it” [WP 287]). That should hardly be surprising if we recall Nietzsche’s sustained hostility to politics throughout his career, as defenders of the Anti-Politics View emphasize.

Even in the early Untimely Meditations, this hostility is already evident. So, for example, Nietzsche comments:

Every philosophy which believes that the problem of existence is touched on, not to say solved, by a political event is a joke- and pseudo-philosophy. Many states have been founded since the world began; that is an old story. How should a political innovation suffice to turn men once and for all into contented inhabitants of the earth? [That people think the answer to existential questions might come from politics shows] that we are experiencing the consequences of the doctrine…that the state is the highest goal of mankind and that a man has no higher duty than to serve the state: in which doctrine I recognize a relapse not into paganism but into stupidity. It may be that a man who sees his highest duty in serving the state really knows no higher duties; but there are men and duties existing beyond this — and one of the duties that seems, at least to me, to be higher than serving the state demands that one destroys stupidity in every form, and therefore in this form too. That is why I am concerned with a species of man whose teleology extends somewhat beyond the welfare of a state…, and with [this kind of man] only in relation to a world which is again fairly independent of the welfare of a state, that of culture. (U III:4)

The same, vaguely anarchistic attitude is apparent in Thus Spoke Zarathustra, where Nietzsche calls the “state…the coldest of all cold monsters” and remarks, aptly enough, that “the state…whatever it says it lies…Everything about it is false” (Z I:11). “Only where the state ends, there begins the human being who is not superfluous” (Z I:11) Of course, it is only the latter individual that really interests Nietzsche. And who is that individual? The next section (Z I:12) tells us: he is the one who values his “solitude,” which is precisely what the “marketplace” of politics violates, with its “showmen and actors of great [sic] things.” “Far from the market place and from fame happens all that is great” (Z I:12): in other words, great things (and great people) are to be found far from the realms of politics and economics.

Passages like these seem to support the Anti-Politics View. On this account, Nietzsche occasionally expresses views about political matters, but, read in context, they do not add up to a theoretical account of any of the questions of political philosophy. He is more accurately read, in the end, as a kind of esoteric moralist, i.e., someone who has views about human flourishing, views he wants to communicate at least to a select few. “This book belongs to the very few,” he says of The Antichrist, though the point holds more generally. Indeed, Nietzsche is clearly describing his own work when he writes in an earlier book that,

It is not by any means necessarily an objection to a book when anyone finds it impossible to understand: perhaps that was part of the author’s intention — he did not want to be understood by just ‘anybody.’ All the nobler spirits and tastes select their audience when they wish to communicate; and choosing that, one at the same time erects barriers against ‘the others.’ All the more subtle laws of any style have their origin at this point: they at the same time keep away, create a distance, forbid ‘entrance,’ understanding, as said above — while they open the ears of those whose ears are related to ours. (GS 381)

Or similarly: “Our highest insights must — and should — sound like follies and sometimes like crimes when they are heard without permission by those who are not predisposed and predestined for them” (BGE 30). Nietzsche, the esoteric moralist, wants to reach only select individuals — those nascent higher human beings who are “predisposed and predestined” for his ideas — and alter their consciousness about morality. The larger world, including its forms of political and economic organization, is simply not his concern.

Even without a political philosophy, however, there remain questions about Nietzsche’s critique of morality and its political implications. For example, when Nietzsche objects that morality is an obstacle to “the highest power and splendor possible” to man, one is tempted to object that this gets things perversely backwards. For surely it is the lack of morality in social policy and public institutions — a lack which permits widespread poverty and despair to persist generation upon generation; that allows daily economic struggle and uncertainty to define the basic character of most people’s lives — that is most responsible for a lack of human flourishing. Surely, in a more moral society, with a genuine commitment to social justice and human equality, there would be far more Goethes, far more creativity and admirable human achievement. As Philippa Foot has sharply put it: “How could one see the present dangers that the world is in as showing that there is too much pity and too little egoism around?” (1973, p. 168).

Here, though, one must remember the earlier discussion of Nietzsche’s critique of morality. Consider the Nietzsche who asks: “Where has the last feeling of decency and self-respect gone when even our statesmen, an otherwise quite unembarrassed type of man, anti-Christians through and through in their deeds, still call themselves Christians today and attend communion?” (A 38). Clearly this Nietzsche is under no illusions about the extent to which public actors do not act morally. Indeed, Nietzsche continues in even more explicit terms: “Every practice of every moment, every instinct, every valuation that is translated into action is today anti-Christian: what a miscarriage of falseness must modern man be, that he is not ashamed to be called a Christian in spite of all this!” (A 38). What, then, is going on here? If Nietzsche is not, contrary to Foot’s suggestion, embracing the absurd view that there is too much pity and altruism in the world, what exactly is his critical point?

Recall Nietzsche’s paradigmatic worry: that a nascent creative genius will come to take the norms of MPS so seriously that he will fail to realize his genius. Rather than tolerate (even welcome) suffering, he will seek relief from hardship and devote himself to the pursuit of pleasure; rather than practice what Nietzsche calls “severe self-love”, and attend to himself in the ways requisite for productive creative work, he will embrace the ideology of altruism, and reject “self-love” as improper, and so forth. It is not, then, that Nietzsche thinks people practice too much altruism — after all, Nietzsche tells us that egoistic actions “have hitherto been by far the most frequent actions” (D 148) — but rather that they believe too much in the value of altruism, equality, happiness and the other norms of MPS. Even though there is neither much altruism nor equality in the world, there is almost universal endorsement of the value of altruism and equality — even, notoriously (and as Nietzsche seemed well aware), by those who are its worst enemies in practice. So Nietzsche’s critique is that a culture in the grips of MPS, even without acting on MPS, poses the real obstacle to flourishing, because it teaches potential higher types to disvalue what would be most conducive to their creativity and value what is irrelevant or perhaps even hostile to it. Nietzsche’s worry, in short, is that the man in the grips of MPS becomes “imprisoned among all sorts of terrible concepts [schrekliche Begriffe]” that leave him “sick, miserable, malevolent against himself: full of hatred against the springs of life, full of suspicion against all that was still strong and happy” (TI VII:2, emphasis added).

So, contrary to Foot, Nietzsche is not claiming that people are actually too altruistic and too egalitarian in their practice; he is worried that (as a consequence of the slave revolt in morals, etc.) they are now “imprisoned among….concepts” of equality and altruism, and that this conceptual vocabulary of value is itself the obstacle to the realization of certain forms of human excellence. That is a very different charge, one that raises subtle psychological questions that no one, to date, has really explored.

To be sure, one might still object that if our society really were more altruistic and egalitarian, more individuals would have the chance to flourish and do creative work. Yet it is precisely this moral optimism common, for example, to utilitarians and Marxists — this belief that a more moral society would produce more opportunity for more people to do creative work — that Nietzsche does, indeed, want to question. Nietzsche’s illiberal attitudes in this regard are once again apparent; he says — to take but one example — that, “We simply do not consider it desirable that a realm of justice and harmony [Eintracht] should be established on earth” (GS 377). It is bad enough for Nietzsche that MPS values have so far succeeded in saying, “stubbornly and inexorably, ‘I am morality itself, and nothing besides is morality’” (BGE 202); it could only be worse on his view if more and more of our actions were really brought into accord with these values. For Nietzsche wants to urge — contrary to the moral optimists — that in a way largely unappreciated and (perhaps) unintended a thoroughly moral culture undermines the conditions under which the most splendid human creativity is possible, and generates instead a society of Zarathustra’s “last men” (Z P:5):

“What is love? What is creation? What is longing? What is a star?” thus asks the last man, and he blinks.

The earth has become small, and on it hops the last man, who makes everything small. His race is as in eradicable as the flea-beetle; the last man lives longest.

“We have invented happiness,” say the last men, and they blink….

If we are trained always to think of happiness and comfort and safety and the needs of others, we shall cut ourselves off from the preconditions for creative excellence on the Nietzschean picture: suffering, hardship, danger, self-concern, and the rest.

Consider a particularly powerful statement of this view. Speaking of those “eloquent and profoundly scribbling slaves of the democratic taste and its ‘modern ideas’” who seek to promote “the universal green-pasture happiness of the herd” and who take “suffering itself…for something that must be abolished” (BGE 44), Nietzsche retorts that when we look at,

…how the plant “man” has so far grown most vigorously to a height — we think that this has happened every time under the opposite conditions, that to this end the dangerousness of his situation must first grow to the point of enormity, his power of invention and simulation (his “spirit”) had to develop under prolonged pressure and constraint into refinement and audacity…. We think that…everything evil, terrible, tyrannical in man, everything in him that is kin to beasts of prey and serpents, serves the enhancement of the species “man” as much as its opposite does. Indeed, we do not even say enough when we say only that much. (BGE 44)

At the end of this passage, Nietzsche does hint at a role for morality as well — it is just that what morality opposes is equally important. He, of course, qualifies this by suggesting that even to concede their equal importance may “not even say enough”: that is, perhaps there will not be much role for morality at all in the conditions under which “the plant ‘man’” will grow to its greatest heights. But notice that, even in this passage, what is called for is not a political transformation, but an individual one, that of the nascent higher human being: it is “his situation” that “must first grow to the point of enormity” and it is “his power of invention and simulation” that “had to develop under prolonged pressure and constraint into refinement and audacity.” As he writes in a Nachlass note of 1887, regarding those “human beings who are of any concern to me”: “I wish [them] suffering, desolation, sickness, ill-treatment, indignities — I wish that they should not remain unfamiliar with profound self-contempt, the torture of self-mistrust, the wretchedness of the vanquished” (WP 910). This is not the outline of a political program, but rather a severe regimen for the realization of individual potential — at least for the select few.

Bibliography

A. Nietzsche’s Writings and Key to Citations

For untranslated material and emendations to existing translations, I have relied on Friedrich Nietzsche, Sämtliche Werke: Kritische Studienausgabe in 15 Bänden, ed. G. Colli & M. Montinari (Berlin: de Gruyter, 1980); this is cited as KSA, followed by the volume number, a colon, and the fragment number(s).

Nietzsche’s works are cited as follows, unless otherwise noted: roman numerals refer to major parts or chapters in Nietzsche’s works; Arabic numerals refer to sections, not pages.

• The Antichrist, in The Portable Nietzsche (below). Cited as A.
• Beyond Good and Evil, trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Vintage, 1966. Cited as BGE.
• The Birth of Tragedy, trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Vintage, 1966. Cited as BT.
• The Case of Wagner, trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Vintage, 1966. Cited as CW.
• Daybreak: Thoughts on the Prejudices of Morality, trans. R.J. Hollingdale, ed. M. Clark & B. Leiter, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997. Cited as D.
• Ecce Homo, trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Vintage, 1967. Cited as EH.
• The Gay Science, trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Vintage, 1974. Cited as GS.
• On the Genealogy of Morality, trans. M. Clark & A. Swensen, Indianapolis: Hackett, 1998. Cited as GM.
• Human, All-too-Human, trans. R.J. Hollingdale, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1986. Cited as HAH.
• Nietzsche contra Wagner, in The Portable Nietzsche (below). Cited as NCW.
• Philosophy in the Tragic Age of the Greeks, trans. M. Cowan, Washington, DC: Regnery Gateway, 1962. Cited as PTAG.
• Philosophy and Truth: Selections from Nietzsche’s Notebooks of the Early 1870’s, ed. & trans. D. Breazeale, Atlantic Highlands, NJ: Humanities Press, 1979. Cited as PT, by page number.
• The Portable Nietzsche, ed. & trans. W. Kaufmann, New York: Viking, 1954. Cited as PN, by page number.
• Thus Spoke Zarathustra, in The Portable Nietzsche (above). Cited as Z.
• Twilight of the Idols, in The Portable Nietzsche (above). Cited as TI.
• Untimely Meditations, trans. R.J. Hollingdale, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983. Cited as U.
• The Will to Power, trans. W. Kaufmann & R.J. Hollingdale, New York: Vintage, 1968. Cited as WP.

B. References and Works on Nietzsche’s Moral and Political Philosophy

• Brobjer, Thomas, 1998. “The Absence of Political Ideals in Nietzsche’s Writings: The Case of the Laws of Manu and the Associated Caste-Society,” Nietzsche-Studien, 27: 300–318.
• Clark, Maudemarie, 1990. Nietzsche on Truth and Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• –––, 1994. “Nietzsche’s Immoralism and the Concept of Morality,” in Schacht (1994).
• –––, 2015. Nietzsche on Ethics and Politics, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Clark, Maudemarie and David Dudrick, 2012. The Soul of Nietzsche’s Beyond Good and Evil, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Clark, Maudemarie and Brian Leiter, 1997. “Introduction” to Nietzsche’s Daybreak, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Detwiler, Bruce, 1990. Nietzsche and the Politics of Aristocratic Radicalism, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Foot, Philippa, 1973. “Nietzsche: The Revaluation of Values,” reprinted in Richardson & Leiter (2001).
• Forster, Michael N., 2017. “Moralities are a Sign-Language of the Affects,” Inquiry, 60: 165–188.
• Fowles, Christopher, 2019. “Nietzsche on Conscious and Unconscious Thought,” Inquiry, 62: 1–22.
• –––, 2020. “The Heart of Flesh: Nietzsche on Affects and the Interpretation of the Body,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 58(1): 113–139.
• Gemes, Ken, and John Richardson (eds.), 2013. The Oxford Handbook of Nietzsche, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Geuss, Raymond, 1997. “Nietzsche and Morality,” European Journal of Philosophy, 5: 1–20.
• Hollingdale, R.J., 1985. Nietzsche: The Man and His Philosophy, London: Ark Paperbacks.
• Huddleston, Andrew, 2017. “Normativity and the Will to Power: Challenges for a Nietzschean Constitutivism,” Journal of Nietzsche Studies, 47: 435–456.
• –––, 2019. Nietzsche on the Decadence & Flourishing of Culture, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Hunt, Lester, 1985. “Politics and Anti-Politics: Nietzsche’s View of the State,” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 2: 453–468.
• –––, 1991. Nietzsche and the Origin of Virtue, London: Routledge.
• –––, 1993. “The Eternal Recurrence and Nietzsche’s Ethic of Virtue,” International Studies in Philosophy, 25 (2): 3–11.
• Hurka, Thomas, 1993. Perfectionism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• –––, 2007. “Nietzsche: Perfectionist,” in Leiter & Sinhababu (2007).
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