William of Ockham

William of Ockham (c. 1287–1347) is among the most prominent figures in the history of philosophy during the Late Middle Ages along with Thomas Aquinas and John Duns Scotus. He is probably best known today for his espousal of metaphysical nominalism. Indeed, the principle known as “Ockham’s Razor” is named after him. But Ockham held important, often influential views not only in metaphysics but also in all other major areas of medieval philosophy—logic, physics or natural philosophy, theory of knowledge, ethics, and political philosophy—as well as in theology.

• 1. Life
  • 1.1 England (c. 1287–1324)
  • 1.2 Avignon (1324–28)
  • 1.3 Munich (1328/29–47)
• 2. Writings
• 3. Logic and Semantics
  • 3.1 The Summa of Logic
  • 3.2 Signification and Supposition
  • 3.3 Mental Language, Connotation, and Definitions
• 4. Metaphysics
  • 4.1 Ockham’s Razor
  • 4.2 The Rejection of Universals
  • 4.3 The Reduction of Ontological Categories
  • 4.4 Material Substances and Artifacts
• 5. Natural Philosophy
• 6. Theory of Knowledge
  • 6.1 The Rejection of Species
  • 6.2 Intuitive and Abstractive Cognition
• 7. Ethics
  • 7.1 The Virtues
  • 7.2 Moral Psychology
• 8. Political Philosophy
  • 8.1 Franciscan Poverty, Property Rights, and the Crisis in Avignon
  • 8.2 Heresy and the Dialogue
  • 8.3 Spiritual and Temporal Power
• Bibliography
  • Primary Literature
    • In Latin
    • In English
  • Secondary Literature
  • Other Bibliographies
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Life

Ockham led an unusually eventful life for a philosopher. As with so many medieval figures who were not prominent when they were born, we know little about the circumstances of Ockham’s birth and early years, and have to estimate dates by extrapolating from known dates of events later in his life.^[1]

Ockham’s life may be divided into three main periods.

1.1 England (c. 1287–1324)

Ockham was born probably in late 1287 or early 1288, in the village of Ockham (= Oak Hamlet) in Surrey. He likely learned basic Latin at a village school in Ockham or nearby, but this is not certain.^[2] At an early age, somewhere between seven and thirteen, Ockham was “given” to the Franciscan Order (the so-called “Greyfriars”).^[3] There was no Franciscan house (called a “convent”) in the tiny village of Ockham itself; the nearest was in London. It was there that Ockham was sent.

As an educational institution, even for higher education, London Greyfriars was a distinguished place. At London Greyfriars, Ockham probably got most of his early education, and then went on to what we might think of as a secondary school education in basic logic and science (i.e., natural philosophy), beginning around the age of fourteen.

Around 1310, when he was about twenty-three, Ockham began his theological training. It is not certain where this occurred. It could well have been at London Greyfriars, or it could have been at Oxford, where there was another Franciscan convent associated with the University. In any event, Ockham was in Oxford studying theology by at least the year 1318–19, and probably the previous year as well, when, in 1317, he began a required two-year cycle of lectures commenting on Peter Lombard’s Sentences, the standard theological textbook of the day. Then, probably in 1321, Ockham returned to London Greyfriars. Although he had taken initial steps in the theology faculty at Oxford (hence his nickname, the Venerabilis Inceptor, “Venerable Beginner”), Ockham did not complete his studies there, and never became a fully qualified master of theology at Oxford. Nevertheless, London Greyfriars was an intellectually lively place, and Ockham was by no means isolated from academic debate. He lived there with two other important Franciscan thinkers, Walter Chatton and Adam Wodeham, both sharp critics of Ockham’s views. It was in this context that Ockham wrote many of his most important philosophical and theological works.

In 1323 Ockham was called before the Franciscan province’s chapter meeting held that year in Bristol to defend a number of his views that were regarded with suspicion by some of his confreres. About the same time, someone—it is not clear who—went from England to the papal court at Avignon and charged Ockham with teaching heresy.^[4] As a result, a commission of theologians was set up to study the case. Ockham was called to Avignon in May, 1324 to answer the charges. He never went back to England.

1.2 Avignon (1324–28)

While in Avignon, Ockham stayed at the Franciscan convent. It has sometimes been suggested that he was effectively under house arrest, but this seems an exaggeration. On the contrary, he appears to have been free to do more or less as he pleased while staying in the city. The investigation must not have demanded much of Ockham’s own time, since he was able to work on a number of other projects while he was in Avignon, including finishing his last major theological work, the Quodlibets. It should be pointed out that, although some stern pronouncements came out of the investigation, his views were never officially condemned as heretical.

In 1327, Michael of Cesena, the Franciscan minister general (the chief administrative officer of the order) likewise came to Avignon, in his case because of a controversy between the Franciscans and the current pope, John XXII, over the idea of Apostolic poverty. This was the idea that Jesus and the Apostles owned no property of their own and had lived off the generosity of others by begging. The mendicant Franciscans also refused all property ownership, maintaining that their own practices were a special form of the “imitation of Christ”. Pope John XXII rejected the doctrine, which is why Michael of Cesena was in Avignon.

The crisis came to a climax in 1328, when Michael and the Pope had a serious confrontation over the matter. As a result, Michael asked Ockham to study the question from the point of view of previous papal statements and John’s own previous writings on the subject. When he did so, Ockham came to the conclusion that John’s view was not simply wrong but heretical. John’s heresy consisted in the fact that he stubbornly maintained his view even after he had been shown it was wrong. As a result, Ockham argued, Pope John was not just teaching heresy, but was a heretic himself and had, therefore, effectively abdicated his papacy. In short, Pope John XXII was no pope at all!

1.3 Munich (1328/29–47)

On the night of May 26, 1328, Michael of Cesena, Ockham, and a few other sympathetic Franciscans fled Avignon and went into exile. They initially went to Italy, where Ludwig of Bavaria, the Holy Roman Emperor, was in Pisa at the time along with his court and retinue. Ludwig was engaged in a political dispute with the Pope, and Ockham’s group found refuge under his protection. On June 6, 1328, Ockham was officially excommunicated for leaving Avignon without permission. Around 1329, Ludwig returned to Munich, together with Michael, Ockham and the rest of their fugitive band. Ockham stayed there, or at any rate in areas under imperial control, until his death. During this time, Ockham wrote exclusively on political matters.^[5] He died on the night of April 9/10, 1347, at roughly the age of sixty.

2. Writings

Ockham’s writings are conventionally divided into two groups: the so-called “academic” and “political” writings. By and large, the former were written or at least begun while Ockham was still in England, while the latter were written toward the end of Ockham’s Avignon period and later in exile. All of his writings are now available in modern critical editions and many are translated into English, in whole or in part.^[6] The academic writings are in turn divided into two groups: the “theological” and “philosophical” works, although both groups are essential for the study of Ockham’s philosophy. Many of his distinctive metaphysical, epistemological, and ethical views are found in the theological works.

Among Ockham’s most important writings, listed chronologically, are:

• Academic Writings
  • Theological Works
    • Commentary on the Sentences of Peter Lombard (1317–18). Book I survives in an ordinatio or scriptum—a revised and corrected version, approved by the author himself for distribution. Books II–IV survive only as a reportatio—a transcript of the actually delivered lectures, taken down by a “reporter”, without the benefit of later revisions or corrections by the author.
    • Seven Quodlibets (based on London disputations held in 1322–24, but revised and edited in Avignon 1324–25).
  • Philosophical Works
    • Logical Works
      • Expositions of Porphyry’s Isagoge and of Aristotle’s Categories, On Interpretation, and Sophistical Refutations (1321–24).
      • Treatise on Predestination and God’s Foreknowledge with Respect to Future Contingents (1321–24).
      • Summa of Logic (c. 1323–25). A large, independent, and systematic treatment of logic and semantics.
    • Works on Natural Philosophy
      • Exposition of Aristotle’s Physics (1322–24). A detailed, close commentary. Incomplete.
      • Questions on Aristotle’s Books of the Physics (started before 1324). Not strictly a commentary, this work nevertheless discusses a long series of questions arising out of Aristotle’s Physics.
• Political Writings
  • The Work of Ninety Days (1332–34).
  • Letter to the Friars Minor (1334).
  • Dialogue (c. 1334–46). Incomplete.
  • Eight Questions on the Power of the Pope (1340–41).
  • Short Discourse (1341–42).

3. Logic and Semantics

Ockham is rightly regarded as one of the most important logicians of the Middle Ages. Nevertheless, his originality and influence should not be exaggerated. For all his deserved reputation, his logical views are sometimes derivative^[7] and occasionally very idiosyncratic.^[8]

Logic, for Ockham, is crucial to the advancement of knowledge. In the “Prefatory Letter” to his Summa of Logic, for example, he praises it in striking language:

For logic is the most useful tool of all the arts. Without it no science can be fully known. It is not worn out by repeated use, after the manner of material tools, but rather admits of continual growth through the diligent exercise of any other science. For just as a mechanic who lacks a complete knowledge of his tool gains a fuller [knowledge] by using it, so one who is educated in the firm principles of logic, while he painstakingly devotes his labor to the other sciences, acquires at the same time a greater skill at this art. (SL, Epist. Prooem., OPh I, p. 6. Translation by Spade)

Ockham’s main logical writings consist of a series of commentaries on Aristotle’s and Porphyry’s logical works, plus his own Summa of Logic, his masterwork. His Treatise on Predestination contains an influential theory on the logic of future contingent propositions, and other works as well include occasional discussions of logical topics, notably his Quodlibets.

3.1 The Summa of Logic

Ockham’s Summa of Logic is divided into three books, with the third book subdivided into four parts. Book I divides language in accordance with Aristotle’s On Interpretation (1, 16^a3–8, as influenced by Boethius’s interpretation), into written, spoken and mental language, with written language dependent on spoken language that is in turn dependent on mental language. Mental language, the language of thought, is thus the most primitive and basic level of language. Book I goes on to lay out a fairly detailed theory of terms, including the distinctions between (a) categorematic and syncategorematic terms, (b) abstract and concrete terms, and (c) absolute and connotative terms. Book I concludes with a discussion of the five “predicables” or universals from Porphyry’s Isagoge and of Aristotle’s ten categories.

While Book I is about terms, Book II is about propositions (propositiones), which are made up of terms. Book II gives a systematic and nuanced theory of truth conditions for the four traditional kinds of assertoric categorical propositions on the “Square of Opposition”, and then goes on to tensed, modal, and more complicated categorical propositions, as well as a variety of “hypothetical” (molecular) propositions. The vehicle for this account of truth conditions is the semantic theory of supposition, which will be explained below. Book III is about arguments, which are made up of propositions made up of terms. It is divided into four parts. Book III-1 treats syllogisms, and includes a comprehensive theory of modal syllogistic.^[9] Book III-2 concerns demonstrative syllogisms in particular. Book III-3 is in effect Ockham’s theory of consequence, although it also includes discussions of semantic paradoxes like the Liar (the so-called insolubilia) and of the still little-understood disputation form known as “obligation”. Book III-4 is a discussion of fallacies.

Thus, while the Summa of Logic is not in any sense a commentary on Aristotle’s logical writings, it nevertheless covers all the traditional ground in the traditional order: Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories in Book I, On Interpretation in Book II, Prior Analytics in Book III-1, Posterior Analytics in Book III-2, Topics (and much else) in Book III-3, and finally Sophistical Refutations in Book III-4.

3.2 Signification and Supposition

Book I of the Summa of Logic introduces a number of semantic notions that play an important role throughout much of Ockham’s philosophy. None of these notions is original to Ockham, although he develops them with great sophistication and employs them with skill.

The most basic such notion is signification. In medieval philosophy, a term signifies what it makes us think of. This notion of signification was unanimously accepted. Although there was great dispute over what terms signified, there was agreement over the criterion.^[10] Ockham, unlike many (but no means all) other medieval logicians, held that terms do not in general signify our thoughts, but can signify anything at all (including things not presently existing). The function of language, therefore, is not so much to communicate thoughts from one mind to another, but to convey information about the world.

In Summa of Logic I, 33, Ockham acknowledges four different kinds of signification. In the first sense, a term signifies whatever things it is truly predicable of by means of a present-tensed, assertoric copula. That is, a term t signifies a thing x if and only if ‘This is a t’ is true, pointing to x. In the second sense, t signifies x if and only if ‘This is (or was, or will be, or can be) a t’ is true, pointing to x.^[11] These first two senses of signification are together called “primary” signification.

In the third sense, terms can also be said to signify certain things they are not truly predicable of, no matter the tense or modality of the copula. For instance, the word ‘brave’ not only makes us think of brave people (whether presently existing or not); it also makes us think of the bravery in virtue of which we call them “brave”. Thus, ‘brave’ signifies and is truly predicable of brave people, but also signifies bravery, even though it is not truly predicable of bravery, since bravery is not brave. This kind of signification is called “secondary” signification. For a first approximation, we can say that a “connotative” term is just a term that has a secondary signification, and that such a connotative term “connotes” exactly what it secondarily signifies. Roughly put, being somewhat over-simplified, connotation is secondary signification. The fourth sense, finally, is the broadest one, according to which any linguistic unit, including a whole sentence, can be said to signify whatever things it makes us think of in some way or other. A sentence signifies in this sense whatever it is that its terms primarily or secondarily signify.

The theory of supposition was the centerpiece of late medieval semantic theory. Supposition is not the same as signification. First of all, terms signify wherever we encounter them, whereas they have supposition only in the context of a proposition. But the differences go beyond that. Whereas signification is a psychological, cognitive relation, the theory of supposition is, at least in part, a theory of reference. For Ockham, there are three main kinds of supposition^[12]:

• Personal supposition, in which a term supposits for (refers to) what it signifies in either of the first two senses of signification described above. For example, in ‘Every dog is a mammal’, both ‘dog’ and ‘mammal’ have personal supposition.
• Simple supposition, in which a term supposits for a concept, which it does not signify. Thus, in ‘Dog is a species’ or ‘Dog is a universal’, the subject ‘dog’ has simple supposition. For Ockham the nominalist, the only real universals are universal concepts in the mind and, derivatively, universal spoken or written terms expressing those concepts.
• Material supposition, in which a term supposits for a spoken or written expression, which it does not signify. Thus, in ‘Dog has three letters’, the subject ‘dog’ has material supposition.^[13]

Personal supposition, which was the main focus, was divided into various sub-kinds, distinguished in terms of a theory of “descent to singulars” and “ascent from singulars”. A quick example will give the flavor: In “Every dog is a mammal”, ‘dog’ is said to have “confused and distributive” personal supposition insofar as

• It is possible to “descend to singulars” as follows: “Every dog is a mammal; therefore, Fido is a mammal, and Rover is a mammal, and Bowser is a mammal …”, and so on for all dogs.
• It is not possible to “ascend from any one singular” as follows: “Fido is a mammal; therefore, every dog is a mammal”.

Although the mechanics of this part of supposition theory are well understood in Ockham and in other authors, its exact purpose remains an open question.

3.3 Mental Language, Connotation, and Definitions

Ockham was the first philosopher to develop in some detail the notion of mental language and to put it to work for him. Aristotle, Boethius and several others had mentioned it before, but Ockham’s innovation was to systematically transpose to the fine-grained analysis of human thought both the grammatical categories of his time, such as those of noun, verb, adverb, singular, plural and so on, and—even more importantly—the central semantical ideas of signification, connotation, and supposition introduced in the previous section.^[14] Written words for him are “subordinated” to spoken words, and spoken words in turn are “subordinated” to mental units called “concepts”, which can be combined into syntactically structured mental propositions, just as spoken and written words can be combined into audible or visible sentences.

Whereas the signification of terms in spoken and written language is purely conventional and can be changed by mutual agreement (hence English speakers say ‘dog’ whereas French speakers say ‘chien’), the signification of mental terms is established by nature according to Ockham, and cannot be changed at will. Concepts, in other words, are natural signs: my concept of dog naturally signifies dogs. How natural signification is to be accounted for in the final analysis is not entirely clear, but it seems to be based both on the fact that simple concepts are normally caused within the mind by their objects (my simple concept of dog originated in me as an effect of my perceptual encounter with dogs), and on the fact that concepts are in some way “naturally similar” to their objects.^[15]

A great deal of modern secondary literature has been devoted to a question regarding mental language. On Ockham’s account, two simple terms (whether from the same or different spoken or written languages) are synonymous if they are ultimately subordinated to the same concept. A single given term of spoken or written language is equivocal if it is ultimately subordinated to more than one concept. Is there equivocation and synonymy in mental language? The debate generated by this question was important not only because it broached how best to characterize Ockham’s mental language, but more broadly it called into question the success of Ockham’s so-called “nominalist program”, that is, his presumed aim of carrying out a semantic reduction of terms in lockstep with an ontological reduction of things in the world to the fullest extent possible.

One interpretation had it that there is no synonymy or equivocation in mental language, with the consequence, so it was argued, that Ockham’s mental language is a kind of lean, stripped down, “canonical” language with no frills or inessentials comparable to the “ideal languages” postulated by logical atomists in the first part of the twentieth century.^[16] This interpretation was challenged by a second interpretation according to which Ockham’s mental language is not a logically ideal language, but incorporates some redundancies and ambiguities.^[17]

What was at stake? Let us return briefly to the theory of connotation.^[18] Connotation was described above in terms of primary and secondary signification. But in Summa of Logic I, 10, Ockham draws the distinction between absolute and connotative terms by means of the theory of definition. For Ockham, there are two kinds of definitions: real definitions and nominal definitions. A real definition is supposed to reveal the essential metaphysical structure of what the defined term signifies, while nominal definitions do not. As Ockham sets it up, all connotative terms have nominal definitions, never real definitions, and absolute terms have real definitions, never nominal definitions (some absolute terms have no definitions at all^[19]).

As an example of a real definition, consider: “a human being is a rational animal” or “a human being is a substance composed of a body and an intellective soul”. Each of these definitions expresses in its own way the essential metaphysical structure of a human being. But, the two definitions do not signify exactly the same things. The first makes us think of rational things plus animals. The second makes us think of substances plus bodies and souls. An absolute term, e.g., ‘human being’, can have several real definitions that do not always signify exactly the same things. They will primarily signify—be truly predicable of—exactly the same things, i.e., human beings, since they will primarily signify just what the term they define, i.e., ‘human being’, primarily signifies. But they can also secondarily signify other things as well.

Nominal definitions, Ockham says, are different. There is one and only one nominal definition for any given connotative term (in mental language, at any rate). A nominal definition is supposed to unfold precisely the signification of the connotative term it serves to define. This can only be done, Ockham thinks, by explicitly mentioning, in the right order and with the right connections, which kinds of things are primarily and secondarily signified by the relevant terms of the definition. The nominal definition of the connotative term ‘brave’, for example, is “a living being endowed with bravery”, which reveals that ‘brave’ primarily signifies certain living beings and secondarily signifies—or connotes—singular qualities of bravery.^[20] Any non-equivalent nominal definition is bound to indicate a different signification and would, consequently, be unsuitable if the original one was correct.

On the first interpretation, several commentators concluded that there are no simple connotative terms in Ockham’s mental language. They reasoned as follows: A connotative term is synonymous with its nominal definition, but there is no synonymy in mental language; mental language, therefore, cannot contain both a simple connotative term and its complex nominal definition. Which of the two goes? Since mental language must have the resources for formulating adequate definitions, the redundant element must be the defined simple term. And, since every connotative term has a nominal definition, then it follows that mental language should only contain absolute terms along with syncategorematic terms. On this interpretation, if anything can be truly said about the world, it can be said only using absolute and syncategorematic terms in mental language. It follows that absolute terms, and only absolute terms, provide us with a guide to what exists in the ontology, nicely bringing together the semantic and ontological sides of Ockham’s nominalist program.

This interpretation led to the conclusion, however, that this nominalist program was bound to fail. For, not all connotative terms can be plausibly eliminated from mental language. Relational terms, for instance, are connotative terms in Ockham’s semantics, and should, therefore, be semantically reducible to combinations of non-relational terms. But this seems implausible. The second interpretation showed that Ockham did hold that there are simple connotative terms in mental language and, in fact, says so repeatedly.^[21] Moreover, Ockham explicitly denies that a complex definition is in general wholly synonymous with the corresponding defined term.^[22] His point, presumably, is that the definition usually signifies more things than the defined term. Take ‘brave’ again. Its definition, remember, is “a living being endowed with bravery”. Now, the first part of this complex expression makes us think of all living beings, whereas the simple term ‘brave’ has only the brave living beings as its primary significates without signifying in any way non-brave living beings as well. This shows in effect that simple connotative terms are not—at least not always—shorthand abbreviations for their nominal definitions. The secondary literature has now gradually converged on the view that there is no synonymy among simple terms in mental language, but that there can be some redundancy between simple terms and complex expressions, (e.g., definitions), or between various complex expressions.

What is the purpose of Ockham’s nominal definitions, then? They are not reductionist devices for eliminating certain terms, but a privileged means for making conspicuous the things that are the primary and secondary significates of the defined terms. The main point here is that such definitions, when correctly formulated, explicitly reveal the ontological commitments associated with the normal use of the defined terms. The definition of ‘brave’ as “a living being endowed with bravery”, for example, shows that the correct use of the term ‘brave’ commits us only to the existence of singular living beings and singular qualitative braveries.

4. Metaphysics

Ockham is most famous for his metaphysical nominalism and ontological reductionism about categories. Not only does he think that everything that exists is individual or particular, he wants to reduce his ontology to a bare minimum of number of kinds by paring down the fundamental ontological categories to just substance and quality. For Ockham, everything that exists in the created universe is a singular substance or a singular quality. In principle, metaphysical nominalism and categorial ontological reductionism are independent from one another. One can deny that universal entities exist, but allow singular entities in more ontological categories than Ockham does. Conversely, one can reduce the number of ontological categories, and yet hold that there are universal entities in those remaining categories. Panaccio (2023) has recently characterized Ockham’s nominalism as the view that for any general, quantitative, and relational term there is no corresponding, special sort of entity.^[23] On this characterization, Ockham’s metaphysical nominalism includes his ontological reductionism about categories, at least for the categories of quantity and relation, by emphatically denying the existence of universal entities, quantitative entities, and relational entities (outside a small number of theological exceptions).

4.1 Ockham’s Razor

Ockham’s metaphysical views are thought to stem from an underlying concern for ontological parsimony as summed up in the famous slogan known as “Ockham’s Razor” according to which one “must not multiply entities beyond necessity”.^[24] Although the sentiment is certainly Ockham’s, this particular formulation is nowhere to be found in his texts. Moreover, as usually stated, it is a sentiment that most philosophers, medieval or otherwise, would accept. Few philosophers endorse an unnecessarily large ontology. Ockham’s Razor is merely a cautionary methodological principle advising us not to endorse a metaphysical claim that requires us to posit the existence of more entities over a competing claim that does not, except under certain conditions. In the fullest formulation of the Razor that Ockham gives, those conditions are spelled out in detail. They are: reason (or reasoning from self-evident premises), experience, and infallible religious authority (namely, Sacred Scripture).^[25] Unless we can meet one of these conditions for some putative sort of entity, we ought not endorse a claim that supposes that sort of entity to exist. If, however, we can meet one of those conditions, then we have good reason to think that the less parsimonious claim is true over the more parsimonious claim.

4.2 The Rejection of Universals

Ockham does not argue against the existence of universal entities on the basis of the Razor. That is, he does not think that we should refrain from affirming the existence of universal entities just because there are no good reasons for doing so in the absence of further evidence. No, he holds that realist theories of universals, at least the realist theories that were prevalent at the time, are outright incoherent. They are either self-contradictory or incompatible with other statements that philosophers hold to be true. For Ockham, the only universals it makes sense to talk about are universal concepts, and, derivative from them, universal terms in spoken and written language. In other words, there is no universal entity of felinity but only singular cats, which are relevantly and essentially similar to one another in and of themselves. There is, certainly, the universal concept of cat. Metaphysically, universal concepts are singular entities like all others. They are “universal” only in the sense of being “predicable of many”, as the term ‘cat’ is truly predicable of each and every cat.

With respect to the exact ontological status of such conceptual entities, however, Ockham changed his view over the course of his career. To begin with, he adopted what is known as the fictum-theory, a theory according to which universals have no “real” existence at all, not being in any of the Aristotelian categories that purport to carve up extra-mental reality. Instead, they are purely “intentional objects” with a special mode of intra-mental existence that is only a kind of “thought”-reality. Eventually, however, Ockham came to think this intentional realm of “fictive” entities was not needed, and by the time of his Summa of Logic and the Quodlibets he adopts the so-called intellectio-theory, according to which a universal concept is just the act of thinking about several objects at once. Metaphysically such an act is a singular quality of an individual mind, and is universal only in the sense of being a mental sign of several things at once and which is, then, predicable of those things in mental propositions.^[26]

4.3 The Reduction of Ontological Categories

When it comes to paring down the number of basic ontological categories, Ockham is more cautious and frequently appeals to the Razor. To understand his perspective on the ten Aristotelian categories, it is important to see that the view he claims to be targeting posits ten fundamental ontological categories: substance, quantity, quality, relation, action, passion, place, time, position, and habit. Ockham, by contrast, thinks that there are only two, namely substance and quality. So, while he agrees with the tradition that there are ten semantic categories, viz., ten basic kinds of linguistic terms (conceptual/spoken/written), there are only two ontological categories of beings.^[27]

Ockham focuses considerable energy on two categories in particular, quantity and relation, while the remaining six categories are cursorily dealt with. When it comes to the category of relation, he admits that there are a handful of relational entities we should posit on theological grounds (viz., the Trinity, the Incarnation, and the Eucharist), but our natural cognitive powers would see no reason to posit them. Outside these exceptions, he is adamant that there is no compelling reason to posit quantitative, relational, etc. entities in the ontology.^[28] Having argued for the existence of substances and, quite notably, for qualities (most of them, at any rate), he argues against the view that quantities (e.g., length, depth), relations (e.g., similarity), actions (e.g., hammering), positions (e.g., sitting), and so on, exist as entities in addition to singular substances and singular qualities. He does so by employing a range of metaphysical, natural philosophical, and even theological arguments to show the absurdity of holding that these are entities distinct from substances or qualities. His arguments appeal to the nature of substances, their parts, and their accidents, the impossibility of actual infinities, and God’s power.^[29] Concomitantly, he provides alternative explanations of how substances and their qualities are extended, related, positioned, etc., that do not necessitate positing anything other than those substances, their parts, and qualities. For instance, he explains that a material substance is extended simply by virtue of having “parts outside of parts”, i.e., having parts, one after or next to another, rather than on account of a distinct quantitative entity, an extension. By application of the Razor, then, we can dispense with the more ontologically committing view in favor of the more parsimonious view on which we are not required to posit the existence of all these additional accidental entities.

Crucial to Ockham’s reduction strategy is the theory of connotation. The idea here is to “paraphrase” sentences containing categorial terms that seemingly refer to real entities which, in fact, we have no good reason to believe in, and in doing so discharge any unnecessary and thus unwelcome ontological commitments.^[30] For example, in Summa of Logic, II, 11, among other places, Ockham argues that we can account for the truth of “Socrates is similar to Plato” without having to appeal to a relational entity called “similarity”:

For example, for the truth of ‘Socrates is similar to Plato’, it is required that Socrates have some quality and that Plato have a quality of the same species. Thus, from the very fact that Socrates is white and Plato is white, Socrates is similar to Plato and conversely. Likewise, if both are black, or hot, [then] they are similar without anything else added. (SL II, 11, OPh I, p. 281. Translation by Spade; emphasis added)

Ockham employs the distinction between absolute and connotative terms as explained above (§3.3) in full force in his discussion of the categories. Because only substances and qualities exist, only substantial and qualitative terms are absolute.^[31] All other categorial terms are connotative and signify those substances and qualities in different ways. And as connotative terms, they have nominal definitions that make conspicuous their primary and secondary significates. For example, the nominal definition of the relational term ‘mother’ might be something like “female animals that produce offspring”. The first term of the definition signifies female animals and the second term signifies her offspring. The term ‘mother’, therefore, primarily signifies female animals and secondarily signifies their offspring. Yet, both female animals and their offspring are just substances. With the appropriate application of connotation theory, then, we can paraphrase sentences using categorial terms, clarifying that they only require the existence of substances and qualities.

It is important to stress that Ockham is not denying that substances and their qualities are quantified, related, positioned, and so on. The sentences “A table is two meters long” and “Socrates and Plato are similar” are objectively true and verifiable of things in the world. Ockham is denying, rather, that quantitative, relational, and position terms, e.g., ‘two meters long’ and ‘similar’ pick out “little” really distinct things that exist in the ontology addition to the table and its extended parts, or to Socrates, Plato, and their qualities of whiteness.

4.4 Material Substances and Artifacts

Because Ockham’s preference for ontological parsimony is so ubiquitous, it can seem that his metaphysics is only negative. All he seems to do is argue against metaphysical claims that are more ontologically committing than those that are less so. While not denying this basic philosophical orientation, it should not detract from the recognition that there tends to be a positive flip side to all this. We have already seen that he does give an account of how material substances are extended. His account of the metaphysical structure of material substances, on the one hand, and of artifacts on the other, are also instructive in this regard. In both cases, it is true that he denies that material substances and artifacts are wholes existing over and above their parts. In both cases, however, he provides an explanation of what sort of wholes they are on the basis of a consideration of their parts and how their parts are unified. Arguing against Scotus, he denies the existence of an additional “form of the whole” that unifies the substantial forms and chunks of matter so as to constitute a single material substance. But this does not mean that he has no positive account of the metaphysics of material substances. On the contrary, he holds that a human being, for example, is identical to its conjoined essential parts, which are its rational and sensory souls as well as a corporeal form and its matter. In the natural order and in the absence of divine intervention, the essential parts of a material substance under particular conditions have an intrinsic disposition to unite in such a way that they form that one single material substance. Similarly, he denies the existence of an additional accidental form that would unify the parts of an artifact. Rather, an artifact like a house, for instance, is identical to a collection of natural material substances, e.g., stones, lengths of wood, etc., that have been moved locally into sufficient proximity to one another.^[32]

5. Natural Philosophy

Ockham’s “physics” or natural philosophy is of a broadly Aristotelian sort, although he interprets Aristotle in his own fashion. Ockham wrote a great deal in this area, although many of those topics we would now classify as metaphysical.

As a nominalist about universals, Ockham had to deal with the Aristotelian claim in the Posterior Analytics that science pertains to certain propositions about that which is universal and necessary. He discusses this issue in the Prologue to his Exposition of the Physics,^[33] and there agrees with Aristotle. But he interprets Aristotle’s dictum as saying that knowledge bears upon certain propositions with general (i.e., universal) terms in them. It is only in this sense that science deals with the universal. This of course does not mean that for Ockham our scientific knowledge can never move beyond the level of language to actual things. He distinguishes various senses of ‘to know’ (scire, from which we get “scientia” and “science”):

• In one sense, “to know” is to know a proposition, or a term in that proposition. It is in this sense that the object of a science is universal, and this is what Aristotle had in mind.
• In another sense, we can be said “to know” what the proposition is about, what its terms supposit for. What we know in this sense is always metaphysically individual, since for Ockham there is nothing else. This is not the sense in which Aristotle was speaking.

As described earlier (§4.3), Ockham holds that we do not need to allow special entities in all ten of Aristotle’s categories. In particular, we do not need them in the category of quantity. For Ockham, there is no need for real mathematical entities such as numbers, points, lines, and surfaces as distinct from singular substances and qualities. Apparent talk about such things can invariably be parsed away via the theory of connotation in favor of talk about substances and qualities. This Ockhamist move is illustrative of, and was influential on, an important development in late medieval physics, namely the application of mathematics to non-mathematical things, culminating in Galileo’s famous statement that the “book of nature” is written in the “language of mathematics”.

Such an application of mathematics violates a traditional Aristotelian prohibition against metabasis eis allo genos, grounded on quite reasonable considerations. The basic idea is that things cannot be legitimately compared in any respect in which they differ in species. Thus, it makes little sense to ask whether the soprano’s high C is higher or lower than Mount Everest—much less to ask (quantitatively) how much higher or lower it is. But for Aristotle, straight lines and curved lines belong to different species of lines. Hence, they cannot be meaningfully compared or measured against one another. The same holds for rectilinear motion and circular motion.

Although the basic idea is reasonable enough, Ockham recognized that there are problems. The length of a coiled rope, for example, can straightforwardly be compared to the length of an uncoiled rope, and the one can meaningfully be said to be longer or shorter than, or equal in length to, the other. For that matter, a single rope surely stays the same length, whether it is coiled or extended full-length. Ockham’s solution to these problems is to note that, on his ontology, straight lines and curved lines are not really different species of lines—because lines are not extra things in the first place. Talk about lines is simply a “manner of speaking” about substances and qualities (taking into account only one of their dimensions, say, their length, while disregarding others, namely, their width and depth).

Thus, to compare a “curved” (coiled) rope with a “straight” (uncoiled) one is not really to talk about the lengths of lines in two different species; it is to talk about two ropes. To describe the one as curved (coiled) and the other as straight (uncoiled) is not to appeal to specifically different kinds of entities—curvature and straightness—but merely to describe the ropes in ways that can be expounded according to two different patterns. Since such talk does not have ontological implications that would require specifically different kinds of entities, the Aristotelian prohibition of metabasis does not apply.

Once one realizes that we can appeal to connotation theory, and more generally the theory of exposition, without invoking new entities, the door is opened to applying mathematical analyses (all of which are exponible, for Ockham) to all kinds of things, and in particular to physical nature.

Ockham’s contributions were by no means the only factor in the increasing mathematization of science in the fourteenth century. But they were important ones.^[34]

6. Theory of Knowledge

Like most medieval accounts of knowledge, Ockham’s is not much concerned with answering skeptical doubts. He takes it for granted that humans not only can but frequently do know truths about the world, and focuses his attention instead on the mechanisms by which this knowledge comes about.

6.1 The Rejection of Species

Ockham’s theory of knowledge, like his natural philosophy, is broadly Aristotelian, although—again, like his natural philosophy—it is Aristotelian in its own way. For most Aristotelians of the day, knowledge involved the transmission of a “species”^[35] between the object and the mind. At the sensory level, the sensory species may be compared to the more recent notion of a sense impression. More generally, we can think of it as the structure or configuration of the object that can be “encoded” in different ways and found isomorphically in a variety of contexts. One recent author, describing the theory as it occurs in Aquinas, puts it like this:

Consider, for example, blueprints. In a blueprint of a library, the configuration of the library itself, that is, the very configuration that will be in the finished library, is captured on paper but in such a way that it does not make the paper itself into a library. Rather, the configuration is imposed on the paper in a different sort of way from the way it is imposed on the materials of the library. What Aquinas thinks of as transferring and preserving a configuration we tend to consider as a way of encoding information. (Stump 1999: 170)

The configuration of features found in the external object is also found in encoded form as a species in the organ that senses the object. (Depending on the sense modality, it may also be found in an intervening medium. For example, with vision and hearing, the species is transmitted through the air to the sense organ.) At the intellectual level, the so-called “agent intellect” goes to work on this species, extracting out of it an intelligible species from which it somehow produces the universal concept that is the raw material of intellectual cognition.^[36]

Ockham rejected this entire theory of species. For him, both sensory and intellectual species are unnecessary for a successful theory of cognition, and he dispenses with them by appealing to the Razor. Moreover, he argues, species theory is not supported by experience. Introspection reveals no such species in our cognitive processes.^[37] His rejection of the species theory of cognition, which had been foreshadowed by several previous authors (such as Henry of Ghent in the thirteenth century), was an important development in late medieval epistemology (For a discussion, see Tachau 1988).

6.2 Intuitive and Abstractive Cognition

One of the more intriguing features of late medieval epistemology in general, and of Ockham’s view in particular, is the development of a theory known as “intuitive and abstractive cognition”. The theory is found in authors as diverse as Duns Scotus, Peter Auriol, Walter Chatton, and Ockham. But, their theories of intuitive and abstractive cognition are so different that it is hard to see any one thing they are all supposed to be theories of. Nevertheless, at a first approximation, intuitive cognition can be thought of as perception, whereas abstractive cognition is closer to imagination, remembering, and generalizing or conceptual thought. The fit is not exact, however, since authors who had a theory of intuitive and abstractive cognition usually also allowed the distinction at the intellectual level as well. In Ockham’s case, his theory of intuitive cognition helps explain that we can cognize an individual as an individual on both the sensory and the intellectual level. Many medieval philosophers tended to deny that we can have direct intellectual cognition of an individual, believing that sensory cognition was of an individual while intellectual cognition was of a universal.

It is important to note, however, that abstractive cognition does not necessarily have to do with abstraction in the sense of producing universal concepts from cognitive encounters with individuals. What abstractive cognition abstracts from is the question of the existence or non-existence of the object. By contrast, intuitive cognition is very much tied up with the existence or non-existence of the object. Here is how Ockham distinguishes them:

For intuitive cognition of a thing is a cognition such that by virtue of it, it can be known whether the thing exists or not, in such a way that if the thing does exist, the intellect at once judges it to exist and evidently knows it to exist … Likewise, intuitive cognition is such that when some things are known, one of which inheres in the other or the one is distant in place from the other or is related in another way to the other, it is at once known by virtue of the incomplex cognitions of those things whether the thing inheres or does not inhere, whether it is distant or not distant, and so on for other contingent truths …

Abstractive cognition, however, is that by virtue of which it cannot be evidently known of the thing whether it exists or does not exist. And in this way abstractive cognition, as opposed to intuitive cognition, ‘abstracts’ from existence and non-existence, because by it neither can it be evidently known of an existing thing that it exists, nor of a non-existent one that it does not exist. (Sent. I, Prologue, q. 1, OTh I, pp. 31–2. Translation by Spade)

Ockham’s main point here is that an intuitive cognition naturally causes in the mind a number of true contingent judgments about the external thing(s) that caused this intuitive cognition. For example, that this thing exists, that it is white, that is at such-and-such a distance from another thing, and so on. This does not prevent God from deceiving any particular creature if He wants to, even when an intuitive cognition is present, but in such a case God would have to neutralize the natural causal effect of this intuitive cognition (this is something He can always do, according to Ockham) and directly cause instead a false judgment. Intuitive cognitions, on the other hand, can sometimes induce false beliefs, too, if the circumstances are abnormal (in cases of perceptual illusions in particular), but even then, they would still cause some true contingent judgments. The latter at any rate is their distinctive feature. Abstractive cognitions, by contrast, are not such as to naturally cause true judgments about contingent matters.^[38]

7. Ethics

Ockham’s ethics combines a number of themes.^[39] Scholars continue to debate how to best characterize his ethics. It is a will-based ethics in which intentions, that is, free and voluntary acts of willing, count for everything. External behavior or actions are morally neutral in themselves. They derive their moral worth from the intentions that underlie them. So, two people can perform the same act—say walking to church, to use a common medieval example—but the person who walks to church because she wants to worship God is morally praiseworthy while the person who walks to church because he wants to gossip with his neighbors is not.

There is also a strong dose of divine command theory in Ockham’s ethics. Certain things, namely certain intentions, become morally obligatory, permitted, or forbidden simply because God decrees so. Thus, in Exodus, the Israelites’ “spoiling the Egyptians” (or rather their intention to do so, which they carried out) was not a matter of theft or plunder, but was morally permissible and indeed obligatory—because God had commanded it.

And yet, despite the divine command theme in Ockham’s ethics, it is also clear that he wanted morality to be a matter of reason as well. He concedes that we can have a “science of morals” by virtue of which, through experience and the exercise of natural reason, we can come to some knowledge of moral principles outside positive human and divine law (Quodl. II, q. 14, OTh IX, pp. 176–8). There is even a sense in which one can find a kind of natural law theory in Ockham’s ethics. One way in which God conveys his divine commands to us is by giving us the natures we have.^[40] Unlike Augustine, Ockham accepted the possibility of the “virtuous pagan”. Moral virtue, for Ockham, does not depend on having access to revelation.

7.1 The Virtues

But while moral virtue is possible even for the pagan, moral virtue is not by itself enough for salvation. Salvation requires not just moral virtue (the opposite of which is moral vice) but merit (the opposite of which is sin), and merit requires grace, a free gift from God. In short, there is no necessary connection between virtue—moral goodness—and salvation. Ockham repeatedly emphasizes that “God is a debtor to no one”, meaning that God does not owe us anything, no matter what we do.

For Ockham, acts of willing are morally virtuous either extrinsically, i.e., derivatively by their conformity to some more fundamental act of willing, or intrinsically. On pain of infinite regress, therefore, extrinsically virtuous acts of willing must ultimately lead back to an intrinsically virtuous act of willing. That intrinsically virtuous act of willing, for Ockham, is an act of “loving God above all else and for his own sake”.

In his early work, On the Connection of the Virtues, Ockham distinguishes five stages of moral virtue, which have been the topic of considerable speculation in the secondary literature:^[41]

• The first and lowest stage is found when someone wills to act in accordance with “right reason”—i.e., because it is “the right thing to do”.
• The second stage adds moral “seriousness” to the picture. The agent is willing to act in accordance with right reason even in the face of contrary considerations, and even—if necessary—on pain of death.
• The third stage adds a certain exclusivity to the motivation; one wills to act in this way only because right reason requires it. It is not enough to will to act in accordance with right reason, even heroically, if one does so on the basis of extraneous, non-moral motives.
• At the fourth stage of moral virtue, one wills to act in this way “precisely for the love of God”. This stage “alone is the true and perfect moral virtue of which the Saints speak”.
• The fifth and final stage can be built immediately on either the third or the fourth stage. Thus, one can have the fifth without the fourth stage. The fifth stage adds an element of extraordinary moral heroism that goes beyond even the “seriousness” of stage two.

7.2 Moral Psychology

At the beginning of his Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle remarked that “the good is that at which all things aim”. Each thing, therefore, aims at the good, according to the demands of its nature. In the Middle Ages, “Aristotelians” like Thomas Aquinas held that the good for human beings in particular is happiness, the enjoyment of the direct vision of God in the next life. And, whether they realize it or not, that is what all human beings are ultimately aiming at in their actions. For someone like Aquinas, therefore, the human will is free only in a certain restricted sense. We are not free to choose for or against our final end; that is built into us by nature. But we are free to choose various means to that end. All our choices, therefore, are made under the aspect of leading to that final goal. To be sure, sometimes we make the wrong choices, but when that occurs it is because of ignorance, distraction, self-deception, etc. In an important sense, then, someone like Aquinas accepts a version of the so-called Socratic Paradox: No one knowingly and deliberately does evil.^[42]

Ockham’s view is quite different. Although he is very suspicious of the notion of final causality (teleology) in general, he thinks it is quite appropriate for intelligent, voluntary agents such as human beings. Thus, the charge that Ockham severs ethics from metaphysics by denying teleology seems wrong.^[43] Nevertheless, while Ockham grants that human beings have a natural orientation, a tendency toward their own ultimate good, he does not think this restricts their choices.

For Ockham, as for Aristotle and Aquinas, I can choose the means to achieve my ultimate good. But in addition, unlike Aristotle and Aquinas, for Ockham I can choose whether to will that ultimate good.^[44] The natural orientation and tendency toward that good is built in; I cannot do anything about that. But I can choose whether or not to act to achieve that good. I might choose, for example, to do nothing at all, and I might choose this knowing full well what I am doing. But even more: I can choose to act knowingly directly against my ultimate good, to thwart it.^[45] I can choose evil as evil. Hence, Ockham can be thought to hold a radical position on the freedom of the will: the human will is free to choose otherwise than it does, and our choices, while they are informed by our intellect, are not determined by it.

For Ockham, this is required if I am going to be morally responsible for my actions.^[46] If I could not help but will to act to achieve my ultimate good, then it would not be morally praiseworthy of me to do so; moral “sins of omission” would be impossible (although of course I could be mistaken in the means I adopt). By the same token, moral “sins of commission” would be impossible if I could not knowingly act against my ultimate good. But for Ockham these conclusions are not just required by theory; they are confirmed by experience.

8. Political Philosophy

Ockham’s political writings began with a discussion of the issue of poverty and property. His views were important for the development of the notion of natural rights and property rights that emerged out of his engagement with the Franciscan conflict with Pope John XXII. This engagement led him, moreover, to inquire into the nature of heresy and the institutional aspect of the Church, particularly the papacy, since one of his central and overriding concerns was whether a pope could become a heretic. Given the authority and responsibility of the pope as the head of (Roman Catholic) Christendom, this in turn led to a generalized consideration of the relations between spiritual and temporal powers (somewhat anachronistically we can call these “church and state”). Concerned to protect temporal power from papal overreach, he was part of a tradition of medieval authors including his near contemporary John of Paris who advocated that these powers should operate within their own sphere, neither one being subordinate to the other and both deriving their legitimacy and authority from independent sources.

Ockham’s political thought is extensive, rich, and less systematic than his academic philosophy. Certain preoccupations, however, recur such as an interest in defending individual human liberty, the contingency, variability, and fallibility of human institutions, and the threat of a heretical pope.^[47] Three main themes are covered here.^[48]

8.1 Franciscan Poverty, Property Rights, and the Crisis in Avignon

As sketched above (§1.2), while in Avignon waiting for the papal commission to decide on the orthodoxy of some of his theological views, Ockham was tasked by Michael of Cesena to look into papal documentation on the Franciscan Order and the question of Apostolic poverty. Some context is necessary to see what the issue was. Foundational to the identity of the Franciscan Order was the original ideal of austere poverty practiced and advocated by St. Francis himself (c. 1181–1226). The ideal of poverty had been, and still is, a common one in religious communities, both monastic and mendicant (mendicant communities being orders like the Franciscan and Dominican Orders, among others, that rose to prominence in the thirteenth century). Typically, the idea is that an individual member of the community in question owns no property at all. If a member buys a car, for instance, it is not strictly his car, even though he may have exclusive use of it, and it was not bought with his money; he doesn’t have any money of his own. Rather, it belongs to the community.

The Franciscan ideal of poverty went further. Not only did the individual friar have no property of his own, neither did the Order. In other words, the Franciscan Order rejected both individual and collective property ownership. They were indeed supposed to be truly “mendicant”, to live by begging and by relying for their basic needs on the generosity of others. Anything donated to the Order, such as a house or a piece of land, remained the property of the original owner strictly speaking, who, however, only granted permission for its “simple” or “bare” use to the Franciscan Order. If that would not work—as, for example, in the case of a bequest in a will—the ownership would go to the Papacy after the original owner had died.

The Franciscan Order thought their ideal of poverty was exhibited by the life of Jesus and the Apostles, who—they said—had given up all property individually and collectively. St. Francis regarded this as the clear implication of several Scriptural passages: e.g., Matthew 6:24–34, 8:20, 19:21, and strove to adopt this ideal for the Order. In 1279, Pope Nicholas III officially approved of this Franciscan way of life. Yet, tensions within the Franciscan Order between moderates (the “Conventuals”) and radicals (the “Spirituals”) about how to manage the Order in practice given this ideal grew over the course of the end of the thirteenth century and into the fourteenth century. The mainstream Franciscan position, adopted by the Conventuals and included Ockham, Michael of Cesena, and others, only expected the Franciscan Order to maintain this ideal. They did not think that there was something morally wrong about property ownership per se. Poverty is not a duty but a “counsel of perfection”, so it is acceptable to own property, but it is better—more perfect—not to. They were not, then, advocating the total abolition of property, and they did not think that the Papacy should not own property. On the contrary, in certain cases, the Papacy owned the goods that members of the Franciscan Order could use.

Pope John XXII decided, however, to reopen the discussion. He issued a series of papal bulls (among which, Ad conditorem in 1322, Quum inter nonnullos in 1323, and Quia vir reprobus in 1329) in which he rejected the Franciscan distinction between use and ownership. He also declared it heretical to hold that Christ and the Apostles did not own property. Drawing on Roman law, John argued that use and ownership could not be separated. The case of consumable goods was especially important to drive this point home: there is no meaningful distinction between use and ownership if, by virtue of using some good, I consume it in such a way that I integrally damage or destroy it, e.g., eating food or wearing out a friar’s habit. For, even if its owner has granted me the use of the good in question, once I have consumed it, the good can never be returned to its owner. For all intents and purposes, it is mine. For John, then, it is impossible to fully live the life of absolute poverty for an individual person, much less for a permanent institution like the Franciscan Order.

Ockham’s first political work, the Work of Ninety Days, is a scathing line-by-line dissection of John’s Quia vir reprobus, in which Ockham argues on behalf of the “attackers” (the Franciscans around Michael of Cesena) against “the attacked” (John). The work is an exhaustive analysis of property and property rights, covering in minute detail different kinds of use and ownership that individuals and collectives can have. Throughout, Ockham consistently maintains the Franciscan distinction between use and ownership, even for consumables, and makes a number of significant elaborations concerning rights and property along the way.^[49] The first of these that bears drawing attention to is a distinction between natural rights, which are independent from any particular legal system, and rights “of the forum”, which are set up by human positive law.^[50] The Franciscan Order only has a natural right of using those goods that are necessary to sustain basic life. Such rights cannot be renounced, since to do so would lead to one’s own harm or death. The Franciscan Order can, however, renounce rights pertaining to ownership, which is what it does by voluntarily opting out, as it were, from the positive legal framework of property rights. A consequence of this is that the Order does not have the right to go to court to settle any property claim. The broader significance of this distinction is the suggestion that there are a certain number of natural, non-renounceable, and inalienable rights that all human beings have.

A second notable elaboration is the origin of property and Ockham’s considered opinion, reiterated in later political works as well, that all property is in fact private and established through human agreement and human positive law. John had justified his view on the non-separability of use and ownership by arguing that the institution of property, and, therefore, property rights, began in the Garden of Eden. According to John, God gave Adam and Eve ownership over the goods they consumed before the Fall, so that property rights were established by divine positive law.

Ockham disagreed. He argued that there was no property in the Garden of Eden, because property implies exclusive lordship over goods. Adam and Eve had no such lordship before the Fall. They simply used—and had the natural right of using—whatever they needed in the Garden. Property was introduced after the Fall by human beings who, seeking to mitigate the violence and greed caused by the Fall, recognized the necessity of establishing legal arrangements for the protection, regulation, and management of property in society. Ockham is quite clear that we established property but he acknowledges that God gives us the power to do so. Property ownership is, therefore, permissible post-Fall. We confer certain legal rights (managing, disposing, transferring, defending claims to, etc.) over certain things (property) to certain people (owners) to the exclusion of anyone else. Owners can, of course, give permission to others to use the goods they own, but that permission does not amount to giving other people a legal right they could appeal to in a court of law. This is the way the Franciscan Order and its members operate according to Ockham. Their benefactors do not give Franciscans any legal rights over the things donated to the Franciscans, but only permission for the simple use of those things, which owners can revoke at any time and for which no Franciscan could lay claim in a court of law.

8.2 Heresy and the Dialogue

John XXII’s view that Jesus and the Apostles did not disavow property ownership is expressed in a number of claims that Ockham concluded were

heretical, erroneous, silly, ridiculous, fantastic, insane, and defamatory, contrary and likewise plainly adverse to orthodox faith. (Epistola ad Fratres Minores, OPol III, p. 6. Translation by Kilcullen in Letter to the Friars Minor, p. 3)

The conviction that John XXII was a heretic and a profound worry about the state of the Church, which he tended to conceive as the totality of believing Christians, led Ockham to write his political masterwork, the Dialogue, to which it is impossible to do justice here. A vast work divided into three parts and left unfinished, the Dialogue is an exchange between a master and a student that was anonymously written—Ockham is not identified as its author—and, more intriguingly, Ockham never specifies what his own opinion is. The student initiates and guides the dialogue by asking the master questions to which the master replies by providing arguments for and against answers to those questions. Ockham is offering, in effect, a massive and often labyrinthine array of arguments on behalf of conflicting claims on many issues. The arguments put forth are from authority, typically based on Scripture, the canon law tradition, and the writings of the Church Fathers, but also include arguments “from reason”. Determining what Ockham thinks on any particular issue is not easy, but one way to decide which opinion is likely his is by comparing arguments and positions from the Dialogue with those we find in his non-anonymous works, like the Short Discourse.

Part I of the Dialogue is about heresy and heretics. Ockham covers a huge range of topics starting with which group of experts, theologians or canon lawyers, has the authority to decide on matters relating to heresy (Book 1). He then turns to what is heresy, which necessitates a discussion of its converse, i.e., orthodox Catholic truth and its sources (Book 2), and who can be considered a heretic (Book 3). At this point, it becomes evident that heresy is not simply some erroneous belief contrary to orthodox faith. Rather, Ockham introduces the notion that heresy involves stubborn (“pertinacious”) erroneous belief contrary to orthodox faith. This focuses attention on the conditions under which a person chooses to believe some proposition p that conflicts with orthodox Catholic truth as contained in, notably, Scripture. Someone who persists in choosing to believe p even after it has been adequately explained to her that p conflicts with Scripture, indicates that she is pertinacious and is, therefore, condemnable as a heretic (Book 4). This explanatory process, an educational venture of sorts, is called “legitimate correction”, and can be licitly pursued by any unerring and faithful Christian or group of Christians within the Church. Institutional power and rank are less decisive for establishing one’s authority to detect and correct heresy than knowledge of orthodox Catholic faith.

The inclusion of pertinacity as a necessary criterion for being a heretic, as well as the introduction of legitimate correction as the first and primary corrective for suspected heresy, indicates that Ockham is open to a limited degree of what we would now call freedom of thought and expression (see Kilcullen 1999 for this reading). Limited, to be sure, to well-meaning and knowledge-seeking Christians who are discussing their faith. As long as one is ready to be corrected, and avoids being pertinacious, there is some latitude for debate especially amongst experts such as theologians.

From here, Ockham launches a comprehensive discussion of whether different members of the Church can become heretics, treating sequentially the pope, cardinals, the Roman Church, the general council, the clergy, and eventually, the whole totality of Christian believers (Book 5). Scholarly consensus is that Ockham holds the view that no one member or group of members of the Church is infallible, including the pope. Consequently, any such member or group of members can become heretics. Accepting Christ’s promise that “I am with you always, even unto the end of the world” (Matthew 28:20), Ockham holds, by contrast, that the whole Church can never err. At any given moment until the Last Judgment, there will be at least one unerring and non-heretical believing Christian who will preserve the Christian faith and make good on Christ’s promise. Part I is completed with a discussion on the punishment of heretics, especially of a heretic pope (Book 6) and how to deal with their supporters (Book 7). Part I of the Dialogue presents, in sum, an immense study of religious belief, authority, and power in society as well as the role and responsibility of individual believing Christians in preserving their faith against any threat to that faith, even when that threat originates in the very highest office of the institution of the Church.

8.3 Spiritual and Temporal Power

A heretical pope poses an existential threat to the Christian community of such proportions that if no member or group of members of the Church is able or willing to depose him, then the temporal power, the head of which is a monarch or an emperor, may intervene. The pope is the head of the spiritual power on earth, but as we have seen this does not render him infallible or immune from censure and punishment. Like his more radical political contemporary and fellow exile at Ludwig of Bavaria’s court, Marsilius of Padua, Ockham sees papal overreach as the source of major social, political, and religious unrest. In particular, Ockham targets claims to an absolutist conception of papal “fullness of power”, a doctrine according to which the pope can do whatever he wants as long as this does not contravene divine and natural law (Breviloquium II, c. 1, OPol IV, 110–11, and following chapters). One of Ockham’s arguments against the doctrine is that it would follow that all Christians would be the pope’s slaves. The preservation of human liberty, therefore, is a primary consideration for rejecting the doctrine of papal fullness of power.

Ockham’s discussion of papal power ultimately forms part of a larger set of views on the origin and nature of spiritual and temporal power, as well as the relations that ought to obtain between them, which he explores in a number of political writings including Part III of the Dialogue as well as the Short Discourse and Eight Questions on the Power of the Pope. In effect, Ockham pursues a dualist path: the two powers are distinct and independent from one another in their separate spheres, both with respect to their origin and their nature, i.e., their governing structures, jurisdictional limits, and responsibilities (to Christians in the case of the spiritual power, to peoples and citizens in the case of temporal power). The origin question is important: Ockham wants to show that temporal power is not subservient to spiritual power in temporal matters, and does not owe its legitimacy to the papacy especially. As with the institution of property, Ockham proposes that after the Fall God permits human beings to organize into political communities, and that we do in fact choose to do so (Breviloquium III, c. 7 and 8, OPol IV, 180–1). In this way, he is able to argue that non-believing political communities like the pre-Christian Roman Empire are as legitimate as Christian political communities, and neither derive their legitimacy and authority from the pope.

The jurisdiction that temporal rulers have is remarkably restrained. Ockham suggests that their central and immediate purpose is the preservation of law and order (see, e.g., Octo quaestiones de potestate papae 13, c. 8, OPol 1, 112–13). By maintaining law and order, temporal rulers are able to keep sufficient peace within the community so that its members are free to conduct their own legally permitted activities and pursuits. The jurisdiction that spiritual leaders have is more extensive, since they are in charge of the spiritual well-being of all Christians in this life and the next. Under normal circumstances, Ockham argues that the two powers are expected to refrain from interfering with one another. They each go about exercising their authority and jurisdiction in their respective spheres, the one regarding temporal matters and the other regarding spiritual matters. However, under very exigent and exceptional circumstances, one power can intervene in the other. Ockham formulates this as the distinction between the “regular” and “occasional” exercise of power. An example is, of course, a pope who becomes a heretic and thereby endangers the spiritual life of the Christian community. If no one within the Church can or will depose him, then the temporal ruler can. The converse holds as well.

Bibliography

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Other Internet Resources

• Mediaeval Logic and Philosophy, maintained by Paul Vincent Spade (Indiana University). Includes links and on-line texts relevant to Ockham such as:
  • Thoughts, Words and Things: An Introduction to Late Mediaeval Logic and Semantic Theory, by Paul Vincent Spade (Indiana University) [Version 1.1a, in PDF].

    (Contains much on Ockham’s logic and semantics.)

  • Translation of William of Ockham, Concerning Virtues and Vices, by Rondo Keele.

    (This is Keele’s translation of Ockham’s short ethical treatise Circa virtutes et vitia.)

• Dialogus, Latin Text and English Translation, John Kilcullen, et al. (ed./trans.), sponsored by the British Academy.

  (Includes extremely helpful materials such as a detailed summary in English of most of the Dialogue.)

Related Entries

Aquinas, Thomas | causation: medieval theories of | Chatton, Walter | Duns Scotus, John | future contingents: medieval theories of | insolubles [= insolubilia] | medieval philosophy | medieval philosophy: literary forms of | mereology: medieval | modality: medieval theories of | obligationes, medieval theories of | political philosophy: medieval | practical reason: medieval theories of | relations: medieval theories of | terms, properties of: medieval theories of | universals: the medieval problem of

Acknowledgments

For the update to this entry published in the summer of 2011, Claude Panaccio became a co-author, having made significant revisions to Sections 3.3, 4.2, 4.3, 6.1, and 6.2. For the update published in spring 2024, Jenny Pelletier has become a co-author. She made revisions to the whole entry and significant revisions to Sections 4 and 8. She will continue to maintain and keep the entry current. She would like to thank John Kilcullen for his helpful comments on the older version of Section 8.