Medieval Theories of Singular Terms

First published Thu Sep 25, 2003; substantive revision Mon Jul 22, 2024

A singular term is a term such as a proper name, a demonstrative pronoun, like ‘this [one]’ (‘hic’ in Latin), or a combination of a demonstrative pronoun and a common name, like (‘this man’), (‘hic homo’ in Latin). This is the stable list of discrete terms we find in terminist tracts from the beginning of the thirteenth century on. What they have in common is that they all signify exactly one individual thing. These expressions, as well as the metalinguistic expressions used to describe them, whether individually or as a whole (‘proper name’, ‘pronoun’, ‘singular/discrete term’), were the subject of in-depth inquiries during the Middle Ages. Indeed, the problem of the signification of individuals is so rich and important that, in a way, it presents a mirror image of the more famous problem of universals in medieval philosophy.

The existence of singular terms raises various questions about how they function within a language. Do proper names have a sense as well as a reference? Is there a real difference between proper names and complex expressions such as ‘this man’? What about singular terms whose referent has ceased to exist, such as ‘Caesar’, or does not exist yet, such as ‘Antichrist’? If they do have a sense, what is it? Is it, for proper names, the proper quality of the grammarians, some ‘incommunicable quality’, the ‘Platonicity’ mentioned by Boethius? How can a proper name such as ‘Socrates’ be a substantial or non-accidental name if the quality it signifies is merely a bundle of accidents? How do singular terms acquire their sense? How is this sense transmitted from one speaker to another? Is a demonstrative pronoun purely referential? If one believes in a language of thought, or mental language, as did many medieval thinkers, what is the mental correlate of a singular term?

While medieval thinkers did not produce any treatises devoted to singular terms, their writings do contain answers to these questions, or at least, to similar questions they themselves posed in the context of their own semantic theories. To discover medieval views of singular terms, one must consult a variety of sources from grammar, especially in works by Priscian (sixth century CE), where the grammar of proper names was presented in a philosophically-tinged terminology, in logic (with the medieval interpretations of singular terms in Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories, De interpretatione, and Prior Analytics), in philosophy (especially in commentaries on Aristotle’s Physics, De anima, and Metaphysics), and theology. In the Middle Ages and still at the beginning of the sixteenth century, singular terms were discussed in treatises devoted to types of terms in termnist logic or in treatises on sophismata.

Singular terms became a major topic of interest during the first decades of twelfth century, emerging from the rich dialogue that was occurring between the disciplines of grammar and logic. There were numerous efforts to develop a semantics of proper names, with the idea that proper names should have a special kind of direct reference while still being distinct from pronouns. The idea that logically proper names should be distinct from ordinary, grammatically proper names was present from the beginning. During the thirteenth century, debates about the semantics of proper names flourished, where the notion of proper names as ‘temporary’ names, not unlike pronouns, became more and more problematical. After Peter Abelard’s remarkable theory of proper names (in the 1110s), the commentaries of John Buridan (d. before 1361) provided the most comprehensive and coherent medieval theory of singular terms, one which remained influential into the sixteenth century. Paul of Venice’s treatise is also worthy of mention here, despite the difficulty of construing many of his claims. During the sixteenth century, singular concepts continued to be a subject of discussion in commentaries on Aristotle’s Physics and De anima, but the logicians who came after Domingo de Soto (1494–1560) offered only cursory treatments of the subject. With a few exceptions, such as the logic of Hobbes and the Port Royal logic (see Pécharman, forthcoming), we have to wait until the nineteenth and twentieth centuries for the problems that exercised John Buridan in the fourteenth century to be fully appreciated once more.

1. Different Types of Singular Terms

Obviously, expressions such as ‘Socrates’ and ‘this [one]’ existed long before they began to be thought about as ‘proper names’ and ‘pronouns’ respectively, whether in technical grammars (the distinction between proper and common names being fixed around the first century BC), or in medieval logic, as ‘singular terms’ or ‘discrete terms’.

Medieval authors had only the term ‘nomen’ available to them, whereas in English we have two expressions: ‘noun’, typically used in grammars to designate grammatical function, and ‘name’, a broader expression used in everyday life but also in logic. In order to reflect the single word in Latin and to capture both the linguistic and the philosophical dimensions of the debate, we will use the term ‘proper names’ in what follows, even in circumstances where ‘proper nouns’ would be preferable grammatically.

The idea of singular terms as a specific linguistic and philosophical phenomenon was present in Aristotle’s logic, well before the advent of technical grammar, most influentially in his definition of singular propositions in De interpretatione 7 as containing terms such as ‘Socrates’, as opposed to particular or indefinite propositions with terms such as ‘man’. It was also present in the Categories 1, with the idea that first substance signifies a ‘this something [hoc aliquid]’, and in Porphyry’s Isagoge, where the notion of an ‘individual predicable’is introduced. The examples given by Porphyry are ‘the son of Sophroniscus’ (provided he has only one son), ‘Socrates’, ‘this white’, and ‘this one coming’ (II/15), to which Boethius added ‘this [one]’ in his commentaries on the Isagoge. Porphyry says: “Such things are said to be individuals, since each of them consists of properties whose collection will never be the same in another” (Isagoge, II/15). Boethius then interprets Porphyrian properties as bundles of accidents (In Isagogen editio prima, p. 81, 26–82, 9), thereby providing crucial materials for the medieval theory of individuation by accidents (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2013a).

It should be noted that there are no expressions such as ‘Socrates’ in Aristotle’s Categories, where Aristotle instead uses the term ‘a certain man’ to signify first substances (Gk. ho tis anthrôpos). The Greek expression had rather a deictic sense. Yet it was translated by Boethius as ‘aliquis homo [some man]’, that is, using the same expression that was used to indicate particular propositions in Aristotle’s logic (as in ‘some man is an animal’), as opposed to singular propositions (as in ‘Socrates is a man’). This is probably the reason why the Boethian translation tended to be replaced by proper names in commentaries on the Categories after Porphyry, as well as by new expressions, such as ‘this man’ (hic homo), introduced by twelfth-century commentators. Expressions such as ‘Socrates’ or ‘this [one]’ began to be described using the grammatical categories of proper names and pronouns by logicians beginning in the twelfth century.

Discussions of singular terms were frequently related to the aforementioned passage from Porphyry’s Isagoge (II, 15), which offered medieval logicians the basis for a classification of types of singular terms. This classification changed over time, reflecting changing paradigms in logic. For example, in Buridan’s classification (see §5 below), the ‘vague indidvual’ is ‘this man’, while for Simon of Faversham, the ‘vague individual’ is ‘some man’ (Commentary on the Tractatus, ed. De Rijk, pp. 88 and 93). In Porphyry’s passage, we find ‘the son of Sophroniscus’, that is, what we would now call an indefinite description, given that the stipulation that Sophroniscus has only one son is not part of the phrase but merely background information. This fact is enough to ensure that the phrase refers to only one individual, but it does not alter its linguistic generality. There was little specific discussion of definite descriptions, but it seems they would have been treated in the same way. John Buridan gives the most direct treatment in his analysis of the phrase, ‘the first Christian king of France [primus rex Francie christianus]’ (In metaphysicem VII/20). This he took to be general, insofar as it is made up of common concepts. In another place (In metaphysicem VII/18), he considers the phrase, ‘the largest and brightest heavenly body [planeta maximus et lucidissimus]’, used to refer to the sun, remarking that the very same phrase could, without any new imposition, supposit for a second sun if God were to create another sun similar to or greater than the first sun in size and brightness. He could be interpreted as saying that the very same phrase could, without being given any new signification, refer to different individuals in different possible worlds (see Ashworth 2004a, pp. 128–129).

2. Various Approaches to Singular Terms in Medieval Thought

1.1 Proper Names and Pronouns in Grammar

The ancient Stoics made a clear distinction between names (which became the proper names of technical grammar) and appellations (which became appellative names) as two different parts of speech. For the Stoics, names such as ‘Socrates’ did not generate determinate propositions, unlike articulations (‘this [one]’), that is, what we now know as ‘pronouns’; rather, they produced intermediary propositions, in the same manner as propositions with appellations (‘man’). This is because, unlike articulations/pronouns, names do not guarantee the presence or existence of the individual (see Brunschwig 1984). The fact that the name ‘Socrates’ could – provided it is not equivocal – identify the exact same individual as ‘this [one]’ was considered irrelevant. However, the differentiating and identifying properties of proper names became crucial in Greek grammatical and logical theories developed during the late ancient period and the Middle Ages (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2013a).

During the Middle Ages, the most important ancient grammatical text was Priscian’s Institutiones, a treatise inspired by the Greek grammar of Apollonius Dyscolus (second century CE), which was strongly influenced by philosophical concepts. According to Priscian, the nomen is the first principal part of speech. It signifies, as proper to this part of speech, “a substance and a quality”. Names are divided into common or appellative names and proper names. Because proper names are a species of name and hence a fully-fledged part of language, they were understood to have the same semantic properties as common names, including a sense. According to Priscian, proper names such as ‘Socrates’ signify a particular substance and its proper quality. Indeed, ‘Socrates’ signifies a substance no differently than the other names of substance, i.e., special and generic names such as ‘man’ and ‘animal’, so that the quality it signifies must be a substantial quality. Names of substances are opposed to adjectives signifying qualities, quantities, or number (for the two (or three) senses of ‘substance’ and ‘quality’, see Baratin 1989 and Brumberg-Chaumont 2007/2011). Following Apollonius, Priscian says that proper names also signify the quality of the corresponding species. Thus, if I say ‘Virgil’, the common quality of man will also be understood. When combined with the Porphyrian definition of individuality as a bundle of properties or accidents, this gave rise to theories according to which the proper quality signified by a proper name contains the essential quality of the species, associated with a bundle of identifying accidents (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2013a).

As proper to this part of speech, pronouns signify the substance only, thanks to their deictic power. The type of pronoun we are interested in here is what medieval grammarians called the primitive (non-derived) demonstrative pronoun, which includes personal pronouns such as ‘I’ and demonstratives such as ‘this [one]’. Demonstration (construed as the act of pointing to something) can be either direct, when something is right before one’s eyes, or intellectual, or a mixture of the two. Setting aside intellectual demonstration, which occurs when the object is incorporeal or absent, the use of a demonstrative pronoun in normal circumstances has the implication that the object pointed to must be present to the speaker. Pronouns were used only instead of proper names (not of common names) because they both signify one thing. Priscian, following Apollonius, also noticed that the deictic demonstration performed by pronouns includes, as an incidental component, the proper quality belonging to the individual demonstrated (Institutiones XVII, 71, GL III, p. 149, 8–10).

However, against the earlier tradition, Priscian contended that proper qualities will never permit us to designate one single individual unless that individual is demonstrated with a pronoun; the inability of proper qualities to do this is stated in principle, i.e., without taking into account the problem of homonymy (Institutions XVII, 63; GL III, p. 145, 16–146, 6; see Baratin 2006). On the contrary, the power of proper names to designate one individual (setting aside homonymy) was crucial for his model (Apollonius), as it precisely explained why pronouns can be used instead of proper names only. This somewhat puzzling aspect of Priscian’s doctrine was ignored by medieval thinkers, who maintained that proper names and pronouns have a similar (although not identical) referential power.

2.2 Synonymy, Metaphor, and Equivocation

Proper names sometimes exhibited the features of common names in various respects. For instance, they could be used metaphorically or metonymically. ‘Achilles’ can refer to strong men; likewise, ‘Nero’ was used to signify a cruel man. More importantly, ‘Marcus’ and ‘Tullius’, as two names of the Roman orator Marcus Tullius Cicero, were favorite examples of synonymous terms. As such, they featured in discussions of the problem of intentional contexts. From classical times on, proper names such as ‘Ajax’ and ‘Alexander’ provided standard examples of equivocal terms. However, it was obvious that there were reasons for giving one proper name rather than another. This suggested to at least some authors that proper names need not be regarded as chance equivocals. In his commentary on the Categories, Paul of Venice claimed that some names, such as ‘Aristotle’ and ‘Plato’ are purely equivocal. However, if several men are called ‘John’ because they were born on the Feast of St. John, the name ‘John’ should be regarded as a univocal term (In praedicamenta, ms. Bodleian, Canon. misc. 452, f. 81ra; see Ashworth 2003, p. 130). He overlooked the distinction made by his contemporary, John Dorp, between a common reason for giving the same name to two children, and the different singular concepts which that name signified. Dorp argued that a common reason was not enough for univocity (Compendium, sig. 2rb). In the sixteenth century, Domingo de Soto used the newly-rediscovered commentary on the Categories by Philoponus (wrongly attributed to Ammonius) to introduce a new type of deliberate equivocal, “from hope and memory”. One might call one’s son ‘Plato’ in the hope of his becoming a philosopher, or ‘Nicomachus’ in memory of one’s father, or ‘Charles’ in honor of the Emperor (for more on the topic, see Ashworth 2003).

In Priscian, appellative names are “naturally” common to the several things they name, whereas proper names are “naturally” the name of only one individual (Institutiones II, 24–25; GL II, pp. 58, 14–59, 1). During the late Middle Ages, while almost everyone except Paul of Venice agreed that proper names must always be equivocal when used of two different people, not everyone wanted to say that they were univocal when used of the same person. The reason had to do with the definition of a univocal term as involving a concept or a quality/nature in principle predicable of several individuals. The usual solution was simply to redefine ‘univocal’ so as to include proper names, but the Categories commentaries by Albert of Saxony, Marsilius of Inghen, and Paul of Venice contain fairly extensive discussions of the issue. Both Albert (Quaestiones in Artem Veterem, p. 294, 345, 302) and Paul (In predicamenta, ms Bodleian, Canon. msc. 452, 83rb-va, unpuslished see Ashworth 2003, p. 239) agreed in opposition to Marsilius (Quaestiones in libri predicamentorum, Bodleian ms. Canon misc. 381, f. 18rb-va; see Ashworth 2003, p. 240) that a proper name could be equivocal without being said to be univocal when used of one person.

2.3 Demonstrative Pronouns and Demonstrative Expressions in Logic

The standard examples of demonstratives were ‘this [one]’ or ‘this man’. The mental correlate in the second case is a common concept individuated by a demonstrative act. Because ‘this [one]’ is tied to particular demonstrative acts, Buridan, like many other logicians in the fourteenth, fifteenth, and early sixteenth centuries, believed that genuinely referring uses of the vocal expression ‘this man’ are equivocal . What I signify when I say ‘this man’, pointing to Socrates, is quite different from what you signify when you say ‘this man’, pointing to Plato, and every use of the phrase requires a new imposition (see §5.1 below). As de Soto pointed out (Summule, f. xix rb), this is quite compatible with the claim that ‘this man’ has an unchanging general sense understood by all speakers of Latin. It is also compatible with failures of reference of various sorts, as Buridan and others frequently remarked. I can say ‘this man’ and point to a donkey (and the proposition will be false), or to nothing (and the proposition will be incongruent, having no truth-value). Similarly, I can utter ‘this chimera’, a phrase that can never have a referent since chimeras are impossible objects.

One might suppose that indicating or pointing is all that a demonstrative pronoun does. As we have seen, Priscian claimed that whereas a name signifies substance and quality (or a substance “with a quality” in the medieval formulation, i.e., a referent plus its property), the pronoun signifies the substance alone, without quality, i.e., a bare referent. However, medieval grammarians and logicians tended to demand some identification of the object denoted. For the use of the pronoun alone, it should be remembered that Latin grammar does not distinguish between demonstrative adjectives, as in ‘This man is white’, and demonstrative pronouns, as in ‘This is a white man’. The Latin term hic is always a pronoun, so that ‘this man [hic homo]’ was probably spontaneously/linguistically understood as something like ‘this one, a man’. In English, one does not really say ‘This runs’, speaking of a man, which is why hic has been translated here as ‘this [one]’.

The sense of ‘hic’ was the subject of in-depth logical reflections. For Dorp and other later logicians, ordinary demonstrative pronouns such as ‘this [one]’ require the presence of an identifying concept. This raised the question of what it is in the mind that corresponds to the pronoun, a question which implicates the more general issue of the mental correlate of syncategorematic terms, that is, terms that perform some logical function (e.g., ‘not’, ‘and’, ‘or’), as opposed to categorematic terms, which are typically nouns and adjectives that fall under Aristotle’s categories. Some thinkers, such as Ockham, thought there are no pronouns in mental language (see §5 below). One could argue that demonstrative pronouns are disguised categorematic terms and that the mental correlate of ‘This man runs’ is ‘The man Socrates runs’ (see Ashworth 2004a, p. 131–132). On the more common view, pronouns are subordinated to special demonstrative or relational acts in the mind. If the pronoun is joined to a noun in a spoken phrase, then it represents a purely syncategorematic act in the mind. If it appears alone in a spoken phrase, there are two possibilities, as John Dorp argued (Compendium, sig. b 2ra). First, it could be taken to be subordinated to a mental phrase containing both a syncategorematic act and a name, in which case it would be legitimate. Alternatively, it could be taken as purely syncategorematic, but this use would be illegitimate because there is no indication of the thing pointed to and a purely syncategorematic term cannot be the subject of a proposition. You cannot successfully entertain the proposition ‘This [one] is running’ without identifying the ‘this’ in some way. However, it seems that the identification need not involve a sortal concept; a singular concept is sufficient (more on this in §5 below, in connection with Buridan’s theory).

2.4 Singular Terms in Logic

One important problem raised by the use of proper names in logic is that proper names are supposed to signify a proper quality where accidental features are included, which would mean that they are accidental names or “connotative” terms, following the fourteenth-century terminology. Singular terms need to correspond to qualities or concepts that would have to be singular, simple, and essential, i.e., non-connotative or “absolute” in the fourteenth-century terminology). But this seemed difficult to achieve. Another major preoccupation was the fact that in many theories, proper names seemed to have only a momentary reference or even to depend on the existence of their bearer for their signification. Yet another problem was the fact that proper names were described as not being predicable, following Aristotle’s Categories, or as being predicable of only one thing, following Porphyry’s Isagoge, whereas they could also be predicated in a predication ‘by accident’ according to the Prior Analytics (see Ashworth 2004b).

The use of singular terms in inferences raised various issues. To begin with syllogistic: despite the fact that proper names never occur in Aristotle’s text as examples in valid syllogisms or even in expository syllogisms, proper names were soon introduced by commentators. This created new problems. Some logicians offered a standard account of the Aristotelian syllogism centered on the universal and particular quantification of general terms, but at the same time included examples featuring singular terms, e.g., ‘Every man is an animal, Socrates is a man; therefore, Socrates is an animal’. One such logician was Lambert of Auxerre (or Lagny), author of a widely read textbook Summa Lamberti. More detailed presentations of syllogistic included an account of the expository syllogism, which is in the third figure and has a singular middle term, as well as of other syllogisms with singular terms. This seemed to go against generally granted syllogistic principles such as “One premise must always be universal” and “Nothing follows from two particular premises”. Lambert dealt with the former problem when addressing enthymematic inferences with a singular term by appealing to formulations such as “Everything that is Socrates is a man (instead of ‘Socrates is a man’ as the unformulated premisse), Socrates runs, therefore a man runs”. He thereby reduces “Socrates runs, therefore a man runs” to a syllogism (Summa Lamberti, p. 139–140, tr. Maloney p. 172). Buridan prefered to reject the first principle and John Dorp explained that the second principle did not apply unless ‘particular’ was used in a narrow sense of ‘neither universal nor singular’. Robert Kilwardby, who wrote an influential commentary on the Prior Analytics in the 1240s in Paris, wanted to resist the introduction of any kind of singular term in instances of canonical valid syllogistic combinations (he used singular terms only for exporitory syllogisms), allowing only particular propositions (see §4.4 below). In the seventeenth century, some logicians treated singular propositions as equivalent to universal propositions, but, as Dorp’s remarks suggest, medieval logicians preferred to classify singular propositions as particular propositions (see Ashworth 1970, pp. 19 ff.; Ashworth 1974, pp. 247 ff.).

Singular terms were also part of the theory of suppositional descent, e.g., when one infers from ‘Every man is running’: ‘Socrates is running’, ‘Plato is running’, ‘Cicero is running’, etc.; or ‘this man is running’, and ‘that man is running’, etc. In the earlier Middle Ages, logicians did not seem to worry about the use of proper names as opposed to demonstrative phrases, but there was some discussion of possible problems in the later period. One problem concerned the fact that there are different types of singular name. Men are called ‘Socrates’, ‘Plato’, and ‘Cicero,’ but donkeys are called ‘Browny (Brunellus)’, ‘Tawny (Favellus)’, and ‘Little Grey (Grisellus)’, so what happens if someone produces the inference, ‘Every man is running; therefore, Brownie is running and Tawny is running’? After all, this inference has exactly the same logical form as ‘Every man is running; therefore, Socrates is running and Plato is running’. Moreover, even if one has the correct type of proper name, its bearer may die, rendering the conclusion false while the premise remains true. If one adopts the preferred solution of replacing proper names with demonstrative phrases, a similar problem arises. If ‘this [one]’ does not succeed in pointing to a living man, then ‘Every man is running; therefore, this man is running’ would be an inference with a true premise and a false conclusion. The problem could be dealt with by adding premises to ensure that the very same things referred to by the true premise(s) are also referred to by the demonstrative phrases in the conclusion. Many other approaches and solutions to this problem were discussed during the thirteenth and the fourteenth centuries (see §§ 4 and 5 below).

Medieval logicians also spent a lot of time thinking about he problem of referring to deceased individuals. There were three issues. First, there was the problem that the same words are used to speak of, e.g., a living person and of a corpse. Following Aristotle (Meteorology 389b31) and Augustine (On Dialectic), logicians were content to accept that if I point to a corpse and say ‘This is a man’ or ‘This is Peter’, then ‘man’ and ‘Peter’ are being used equivocally, in some different or extended sense. Second, there was the problem of establishing a referent for such propositions as ‘Adam was in Paradise’ or ‘Adam is dead’. Here supposition theory came into play, for it allowed reference not just to present objects, but also to past, future, and possible objects. Third, there was the problem which was the focus of special attention in the second half of the thirteenth century, namely, whether the proposition ‘Caesar is a man’ is true, considering that ‘Caesar’ is used for an individual that has existed but no longer exists, whereas ‘Socrates’ is supposed to refer to a presently-existing individual. This question had to do in large part with the interpretation of ‘is’. The issue here is whether proper names lose their signification when their bearer dies. If they do, it seems that any discussion of the past will be senseless. The solutions illustrate the importance of the mind in signification. For instance, Boethius of Dacia said that ‘Socrates’ signifies the same individual that has existed after Socrates’s death even if Socrates does not exist any longer because the signification of words depends on intellection, which itself does not depend on the existence of things (Boethii Daci Aliorumque Sophismata, p. 127–128). An opposing view was presented by Roger Bacon, who held that proper names are radically equivocal because they are subject to being reimposed on the representation when the individual named ceases to exist (De signis, §26). The person who cries out ‘John is dead’, intending to refer either to a thing in the past or to a corpse, has given a new imposition to the word ‘John’, even if his grief prevents him from realizing it.

2.5 Singular Terms in Theology

Proper names began to be discussed by the Cappadocian Fathers in connection with theological matters (see Kalligas 2002; Robertson 2002). Problems of naming often arose in theological contexts and Aquinas’s own list of reasons for bestowing proper names is part of his discussion of whether Christ was appropriately named ‘Jesus’. The term ‘God’ was the focus of particular attention. Praepositinus of Cremona said that properly speaking, ‘God’ is neither a proper name nor a common term, whereas other early theologians suggested that it is a proper name because it refers to a reality that can only be singular. The majority view was expressed by Aquinas, who argued that the term ‘God’ is similar to the term ‘sun’ insofar as we know that both have only one referent, although in the case of God, the term can have only one referent. Even so, ‘God’ is a common term. For many later medieval logicians, the term ‘God’ appears along with ‘sun’ and ‘moon’ as examples of words that are not singular terms, despite the fact that they supposit for only one thing.

The Trinity caused particular problems for logicians because of the unique relation between the three persons and the one divine essence which is, as Ockham put it in his Summa logicae, “one and simple and one in number and singular to the highest degree, and yet in several things.” Inferences such as ‘This divine essence is the Father, this divine essence is the Son; therefore, the Father is the Son’ seem to have true premises asserting an identity between singular things, yet the conclusion is unacceptable. Various solutions were found, including some that explored various senses of identity and different types of predication (for more paralogisms of the Trinity, see Gelber 1974 and 2004; Boehner 1944). The Roman Catholic doctrine of transsubstantiation led to a discussion of demonstrative phrases. When the priest elevates the bread during the Eucharist and utters the words ‘This is my body’, the substance is said to change from bread into the body of Christ. What, then, is the referent of the word ‘this’? (see Rosier-Catach 2004).

3. The Semantic of Singular Terms in Twelfth-Century Logic and Grammar

3.1 New Elements

Priscian’s Institutiones, rich with philosophical insights (see the contributions by Luthala, Ebbesen, and Garcea in Hotltz et al. 2009), was the subject of philosophically-inspired commentaries since the beginning of the twelfth century (Rosier-Catach 2011; Grondeux and Rosier-Catach 2017). The first in-depth commentaries on what was later known as the logica vetus or ‘Old Logic’ (i.e., Boethius’ Latin translations and commentaries on Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories and De interpretatione, plus a few other texts) began during the same period (Rosier-Catach and Goubier 2019). Masters from the twelfth century offered sophisticated semantic discussions of proper names, in which logic and grammar were fruitfully combined (Brumberg-Chaumont 2007; Brumberg-Chaumont, forthcoming-b). They employed a new distinction between nomination and signification, identifying the grammatical ‘proper quality’ with the Porphyrian ‘bundle of properties’ — or accidents, as Boethius interpreted them — which was in turn connected to Boethius ‘Platonicity’, the ‘incommunicable property’. These two novelties are already found in an anonymous multi-layered commentary, the Glosulae, which is the first important commentary on Priscian’s Institutiones, dating from the very beginning of the twelfth century (partial ed. in Rosier-Catach 2008). This text says that a name (whether proper or common) (i) signifies a quality (whether proper or common), which it does not name, and (ii) names a substance or several substances as determined by that quality: an individual substance in the case of proper names such as ‘Socrates’, via the proper quality, i.e., the unique bundle of accidents plus the quality of the species they signify; a plurality of substances in the case of common names such as ‘man’, via the common quality they signify. Proper names were also compared to pronouns, as they were in traditional grammar. The parallelism was reinforced because, as early as the Glosulae, proper names were endowed with the same ability to identify strictly a “determinate person”, something that was the absolute preserve of pronouns in ancient grammar.

The logico-grammatical context that characterized twelfth-century discussions gave rise to a set of specific issues. The problem of the substantiality of the signification exhibited by proper names such as ‘Socrates’ became a major preoccupation in logic, where ‘Socrates’ had to belong to the category of substance by the essential determination through which it signifies the subject and not only because what it signifies is indeed a substance. But this was the case in grammar as well. In Priscian’s theory too, as we have seen, proper names such as ‘Socrates’ must belong to the category of names signifying substance, as opposed to adjectives, which signify accidents such as quality, quantity, or number. The issue was made especially difficult because of the identification of the grammatical proper quality with the Porphyrian unique set of accidents. This identification and the prevalent doctrine of individuation by accidents to which it was associated were indeed harshly criticized by Abelard.

The distinction between naming and signifying became the main instrument for the most powerful solutions put forward. This gave rise for the first time to fully-fledged semantic theories of proper names, i.e., theories ascribing a semantic structure to proper names distinct from that of common names, as well as from pronouns. Proper names were conceptualized as referring expressions with a special medieval variety of direct reference: a reference not determined by descriptive content (which, in this period, would inevitably have been brought to mind a unique bundle of accidents), but nonetheless able to signify additionally the proper quality, as well as to directly name and signify the individual substance (as in William of Conches; see Brumberg-Chaumont 2011) or as having the “determination” or “meaning” of the substantial special quality (as in Abelard).

3.2 Singular Terms in Peter Abelard’s Logic

In the Dialectica and the Logica Ingredientibus (composed between 1116 and 1119), Abelard offered an incredibly complex and complete approach. He developed his theory of proper names and pronouns in constant dialogue with grammar, especially ideas found in the Glosulae. He explicitly referred to Priscian and to his contemporary interpreters when he castigated any theory of individuation by the accidents as self-contradictory. He could not accept that the proper name ‘Socrates’ signifies a unique bundle of accidents, ‘Socrateity’, or worse, that ‘Socrates’ would name these accidents in addition to Socrates himself, because such accidents would be constitutive of Socrates as the individual he is (Super Porphyrium, p. 63, 31–64, 6; p. 64, 26–32).

Building a robust semantics of proper names is crucial to Abelard’s logic, insofar as his rejection of realism and his strict ontological particularism make universal names especially problematic, since nothing that is universal exists in itself or in any individual. On the contrary, proper names are the sole linguistic entities to which a real thing — the individual Socrates in the case of ‘Socrates’ — obviously corresponds. For Abelard, the individual and individuality are primary data that do not need to be explained: the individual “consists simply in personal distinction” (Super Porphyrium, p. 64, 20–24). This does not mean that Abelard can be satisfied with proper names that refer directly, without “meaning” (sensus), because the Aristotelian category to which a proper name belongs is decided by the determination carried out by the name, not by the thing named itself (Glossae super Predicamenta, p. 116); it is the same meaning of the predicate term and the subject term that decides whether a proposition is essential or not. The meaning of ‘Socrates’ must be essential if ‘Socrates’ is to be in the category of the substance and if ‘Socrates is a man’ is to be an essential proposition.

Part of Abelard’s solution consists in saying that proper names such as ‘Socrates’ mean exactly the same thing as ‘this man’, namely, “man in his personal distinction”. This theory is a consequence of the new use of examples such as ‘this man’ as names of primary substances in commentaries on the Categories. We see this use in Abelard’s Logica ingredientibus, but it must have existed in earlier anonymous texts, as he himself suggests, because he criticizes those who differentiate ‘this man’ and ‘Socrates’: “[Some people] want ‘this man’ to be the sign [notare] of nothing other than man in his personal essence, but this name which is ‘Socrates’, they say, designates the accidents” (Super Porphyrium, p. 64, 26–30). Abelard claims the two expressions are equivalent in logic, as opposed to grammar, where the signification of the accidents via the notion of a proper quality seemed to him inevitable. This means that, in grammar, we would have a new meaning (acceptio) for the name ‘Socrates’ and that this name would no longer signify the individual as a substance (Super Porphyrium, p. 65, 5–11).

Abelard draws a clear distinction between naming and signifying in the cases of proper names and common names. He asserts: “by ‘Socrates’ … a certain thing is determined and identified … Singular names [can] not only name, but also determine the underlying thing.” On the other hand, “‘man’ is rightly said to signify neither Socrates nor any other, for none [of them] is identified by virtue of the name, though it does name the singulars” (Super Porphyrium, p. 21, 36–22, 6). Abelard also contends that proper names and appellative names have different causes of invention: the “distinction of the substance” for the former, and the “quality of the substance” for the latter (Glossae super Predicamenta, p. 157, 29–31).

Proper names are, however, clearly distinguished from pronouns, in connection with which the traditional grammatical description is mobilized when Abelard encounters terms such as “this [on]” among the predicables in Boethius’s commentary. These terms are said to signify a “pure substance”; they have been “invented according to personal distinction” only; “they determine no nature or property” (Super Porphyrium, p. 39, 16–24). Here the second part of Abelard’s solution appears: although proper names were not invented to determine qualities, proper names do determine qualities, i.e., “the same qualities as those contained in superior names [superiora nomina]” (Glossae super Predicamenta, p. 157, 31–32). By ‘superior names’, he was referring to names located above individual names in Porphyry’s tree, such as ‘animal’ and ‘man’. Here we meet again the idea, inherited from Apollonius and Priscian, that proper names contain the meaning of appellative names, but, unlike traditional grammar and what is claimed by the Glosulae, Abelard thinks proper names do not additionally contain the signification of individual accidents. The fact that the proper name determines the same essential properties as ‘man’, without signifying them, explains how ‘Socrates’ can be located in the category of substance (Super Porphyrium, p. 64, 33–65, 5) and how the proposition ‘Socrates is a man’ can be an essential necessary proposition. This is because the “meaning” (sensus) of the “formula” corresponding to ‘man’ is included in the name ‘Socrates’ (Glossae Super Predicamenta, p. 126, 37–127, 5; see also Super Porphyrium, p. 72). And so essential qualities take part of the meaning of proper names without being part of their signification.

Abelard does not deny that a bundle of accidents can be unique to one individual and play a role in the way we identify this individual. But the association of ideas between a proper noun and the accidental qualities attached to an individual is explained on ontological grounds, i.e., by the fact that the individual is the substrate of accidents, in such a way that these accidents are indirectly associated with the proper name. This has nothing to do with semantics (Super Porphyrium, p. 63, 8–30). Abelard describes this kind of association by introducing a sense of “signification” that has nothing to do with human language, but is related to the notion of a natural sign, as a dog’s barking is a sign of its anger (Dialectica, pp. 112 and 114).

Abelard offers a highly specific semantics of proper names based on a logical analysis that is independent of grammatical theory, as well as on a sharp distinction between semantic properties and real properties (where individual substances always exist with particular accidents), and, again, between semantic properties and subjective, psychological representations, where individual, identifying accidents are always in fact associated with the use of a proper name in everyday life.

With respect to our intellectual grasp of the singulars to which ‘this man’ and ‘Socrates’ must correspond, Abelard makes clear that it is an abstractive intellective cognition in the sense that it isolates one feature (this man) from others (this animal; this white) in a data complex represented by the underlying subject of perception (Super Porphyrium, p. 27). Here we encounter, through Boethian sources, what will later on, through Aristotelian and Avicennian sources, be described as the distinction between determinate and vague individuals (see §5.1 below). The underlying subject is the concrete individual with all its properties, whether essential or accidental, from which the universal intellection of man is also derived (Glossae Super Predicamenta, p. 142). The signification of the intellection guarantees the permanence of the signification of the words even if the things referred to no longer exist (Super Peri Hermeneias, p. 309). This should also apply to ‘Socrates’ and to ‘this man’, but Abelard does not go further in his explanation of the function of the concepts corresponding to demonstrative pronouns when the thing pointed to is no longer present or existing.

4. The Problem of Proper Names and Proper Naming in Thirteenth-Century Logic and Philosophy

4.1 Thirteenth-Century Innovations

We can select three genres where singular terms were addressed during the thirteenth century: (i) terminist tracts, where singular terms appeared as “discrete terms”; (ii) sophismata literature, especially in the sophismata with ‘Caesar’, as well as the use of ‘Socrates’ as an example of a singular term in OHNEA sophismata (‘Every man is necessarily an animal [Omnis Homo de Necessitate Est Animal)]’; and (3) commentaries on the Metaphysics, in which a new question was raised, ‘Can particulars have a proper names?’, a question also found into other kinds of texts.

Not every medieval text directly concerned with the signification of singular terms endeavored to offer in-depth philosophical discussions of them. This was true of two very influential grammatical treatises from the second half of the twelfth century, namely the Summa ‘Absoluta cuiuslibet’ of a certain Peter of Spain (not to be confused with the thirteenth-century author of the Summulae logicales) and of the Summa super Priscianum of Peter Helias. It applies even more during the thirteenth century, when the prospect of a satisfying explanation of the signification of proper names became more and more remote thanks to a series of philosophical novelties. We can observe this trend especially in Modistic treatises on grammar written from the 1260s on (for Modism, see Rosier-Catach 1983; Marmo 1994), by authors such as Michael of Morbais, Boethius of Dacia, John of Dacia, and Martin of Dacia, whose positions about proper names signifying an essence as existing in the singular together with individuating material conditions appear close to that of Thomas Aquinas, but are not further developed (see Brumberg-Chaumont, forthcoming-b).

In addition to the issues raised during the first half of the twelfth century, the semantic consequences of remarks in texts by Aristotle, Avicenna, and Averroes, newly translated in the latter half of the twelfh century and the beginning of the thirteeenth century, presented a unique set of difficulties. First, the Aristotelian idea that individuals have no essence or definition of their own, together with the theory of individuation by matter (or by form and matter) — as opposed to the twelfth-century theory of individuation by accidents — seemed to imply that individuals cannot really be named as individuals, or that proper names signify individuals only as individuated by material circumstances, that is, as unknowable. Second, the Avicennian theory of the three states of essence seemed to force singular terms to signify the essence only as existing in the sensible singulars. And third, the Averroist analysis of certain semantic aspects of the Metaphysics, which had common names signifying first the form and secondarily the aggregate or ‘suppositum’, seemed to imply that singular names signify the aggregate directly (see Ebbesen 2000; Pinborg and Ebbesen 1984; Brumberg-Chaumont 2005).

In order to understand thirteenth-century logic, one has to consider that, unlike the view held by most later logicians, some universal propositions were viewed by many thirteenth-century masters as lacking existential import. As a consequence, particular propositions (we can see here why, following modern terminology, they should not be called ‘existential propositions’) and even singular propositions, if correctly inferred from a universal proposition in a logical descent, also came to be seen as lacking existential import — unless singular propositions were simply to be expelled from any inference involving universal propositions. The latter option would be bound to raise serious issues, since inferences from universal to subordinated singular propositions formed the basis of the theories of supposition and verification by logical descent, e.g., from ‘Every man is an animal’ to ‘Socrates (or this man) is an animal’, ‘Plato (or that man) is an animal’, etc.

4.2 Singular Terms in Terminist Logic

In terminist tracts, proper names are generally considered to be paradigmatic “discrete terms”, a category that includes proper names, pronouns, and expressions such as ‘this man’. In a theory of referential variation in propositional contexts, singular terms are paradoxically inserted as totally invariant terms, since they generally have no mode of supposition apart from discrete supposition. Some authors, such as William of Sherwood (1230s/1240s), or William Arnaud in his commentary on Peter of Spain’s Tractatus (1290s) tried to argue that singular terms (proper names) could have simple supposition as in ‘Socates is predicable of only one’, but they were confronted with great difficulties. Individual things have no ‘form’ for which the singular term could supposit in simple supposition; the singular ‘intention’ for which the singular term supposits in simple supposition remains unexplained (for further discussion, see Brumberg-Chaumont 2013b).

Masters who insist on the semantic specificity of proper nouns assert the identity of the significate, the suppositum, and the appellatum, i.e., the existing thing. This doctrine is supported by the best-known terminist textbook of the Middle Ages, Peter of Spain’s Tractatus, dating from the 1230s/1240s (Tractatus, pp. 197–198). Peter also thought that discrete terms only had discrete supposition. In his Syncategoremata, he describes names such as ‘Socrates’ as temporary, ‘as-of-now [ut nunc]’ terms (Syncategoremata, pp. 296–298). But this theory led to serious difficulties and sometimes incoherent positions. Peter did not explain what happens when an existing individual, which is the significate, suppositum, and appellatum, disappears. In his source, a Parisian treatise called the Summule antiquorum, proper names appear to change their semantic structure depending on whether or not the individual named exists; in the former case, the significate and the suppositum are identical to the appellatum; in the latter, the significate and the suppositum are identical, but the appellatum is absent (see Anonymous, Summule antiquorum, ed. L. M. de Rijk, p. 13). Furthermore, in yet another passage of the Tractatus, Peter concedes the possibility of inferring a subordinate singular proposition from a universal proposition (‘Every man is mortal; therefore, Socrates is mortal’ (Tractatus, p. 83), which presupposes that the two propositions have the same truth conditions with regard to existential import. However, he argues in the Syncategoremata that inferences involving mixed modal absolute propositions, such as ‘Man is necessarily an animal’, and ut nunc propositions, as ‘Socrates is a man’, which are true for a time, are fallacious (Syncategoremata, pp. 296–298). Consequently, the mixed modal syllogism Barbara LXL (necessary/assertoric/necessary), namely ‘Every man is necessarily a animal; Socrates is a man; therefore, Socrates is necessarily an animal’, which follows an LXL combination, viewed as valid by Aristotle without restriction, should be considered fallacious. This connects with the famous medieval sophismatic proposition, ‘Every man is necessarily an animal’, where this LXL syllogism systematically appeared in discussions.

4.3 Sophismatic Discussions of Singular Terms

The problem of the semantics of proper names appears in at least six of the OHNEA ‘Every man is necessarily an animal’ sophismata catalogued by Ebbesen and Goubier (see Ebbesen and Goubier 2011). Proper names are also discussed in sophismata containing the proper name ‘Caesar’ (Brumberg-Chaumont forthcoming-a)

The aforementioned LXL syllogism was used to demonstrate that the sophismatic proposition ‘Every man is necessarily an animal’ is false because it leads to the obviously false proposition ‘Socrates is necessarily an animal’ in a correct deduction in which the second premise, ‘Socrates is a man’ is obviously true – from which it follows that the major must be false. According to one strategy, defending the truth of the major proposition involves exposing the argument as incorrect (ill-formed; fallacious) because of the introduction of an ut nunc proposition with a proper noun conceived as a ‘temporary’ (ut nunc) term, where you should have only an “absolute assertoric” (simpliciter de inesse) proposition in the minor position.

The defense of the truth of sophismatic proposition using this first strategy can be found in various sophismatic texts, especially one of the earliest OHNEA sophisma, the Anonymus Erfordiensis, from the 1240s (see De Libera, 2002, p. 232). It says that the LXL argument is not valid, so it is not the case that the major must be false. This is because the LXL combination is considered valid only on the condition that the assertoric minor proposition is absolute (simpliciter), not as-of-now (ut nunc). The way the condition is explained suggests that it is impossible to combine as-of-now propositions not only with absolute necessity propositions, but also with any absolute proposition, even assertoric ones, such as “every man is a animal”. This reason is that mixing as-of-now and absolute propositions makes the inference invalid or, according to some authors, fallacious. This saves the truth of the OHNEA proposition, but at an enormous logical cost.

Accordingly, some masters developed another strategy for defending the truth of the sophismatic proposition. Here the aforementioned mixed modal syllogism is taken to be valid, so that proper nouns are no longer described as temporary, but absolute, just like the term ‘man’ (see for instance the Anonymus Liberanus, ed. in De Libera 2009, p. 221; Anonymus Alani 13, ed. in Gazziero and De Libera 2008, pp. 361–362). When logically analyzed, the proper noun with its individual dimension is eliminated, as it becomes equivalent to the name of the species to which the individual belongs; thus, ‘Socrates is a man [Socrates est homo]’ becomes the identity statement, ‘man is man [homo est homo]’. Paradoxically, some masters viewed singular propositions as even more necessarily true and devoid of existential import than universal propositions such as ‘Every man is an animal’. This theory amounts to the logical elimination of proper names. Similar ideas appear in the discussion of the sub-sophisma ‘Caesar is a man, Caesar being dead [Caesar est homo, Caesare mortuo]’ in the Anonymus Liberanus. The idea that individuals do not have a name or a definition as a consequence of their having no form of their own is clearly formulated here. The truth of the proposition ‘Caesar is a man’ is not jeopardized by an empty term because the significate of ‘Caesar’ is the same, whether Caesar exists or not (Libera 2009, p. 230).

Discussions of the role of proper nouns in this sophisma can also be found outside the sophismatic literature. This is the case in Robert Kilwardby’s commentary on the Prior Analytics. His aim was to exclude proper names from modal syllogistics by treating them as ‘temporary [ut nunc]’ names. According to Kilwardby, proper names are not to be subordinated to universal terms such as ‘man’ and therefore should be eliminated in favor of terms that enable the formation of truly subordinate propositions, i.e., particular propositions constructed with terms such as ‘some man’. ‘This man’ is inadmissible for the same reason (Robert Kilwardby, Notule Libri Priorum, p. 326).

4.4 The Metaphysics of Proper Names: Can Particulars have Proper Names?

A third kind of discussion is found in commentaries on Metaphysics VII. A distorted Latin translation and interpretation of a remark at 1035b1–3 seemed to make Aristotle say, “particulars do not have a proper name [particularia enim non habent proprium nomen].” This reading echoed Aristotle’s suggestion in the same passage that individuals lack an essence and definition of their own. And so the question arose, ‘Do particulars have real/proper names?’, which is found in at least five Metaphysics commentaries from the thirteenth century, by Richard Rufus of Cornwall, Adam of Bockenfield, Roger Bacon, Geoffrey Aspall, and Richard Clive. It is also found in other texts, such as an important anonymous pre-Modist commentary on Priscian Major (Ps-Robert Kilwardby), Roger Bacon’s De signis, Siger of Brabant’s commentary on De anima, Robert Kilwardby’s commentary on Isagoge, Henry of Ghent’s Lectura ordinaria, and Albert the Great’s De intellectu et intelligibili (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2005 and Brumberg-Chaumont forthcoming-a).

The question asked by Geoffrey Aspall in his Metaphysics commentary (1250s), “Do particulars have real names?”, can be understood in three senses: ‘Do particulars have names?’ — obviously they do; ‘Do particulars have names of their own?’; and ‘Do particulars have names that would properly be names?’. Geoffrey answers: “individuals do not properly have names. There are in fact two ways in which anything can have a name. Either this name is imposed from a form by signification, so that signification is not the same as appellation – this is what it means to have a proper name (i.e. to be properly a name), and it is this name that the universal possesses – or else it is imposed by appellation, and it is this name that the particular possesses. In the latter case, the significate and the appellatum are the same, and so the particular does not properly have a name” (Geoffrey Aspall, Quaestiones in Metaphysicam, ed. in Brumberg-Chaumont 2005, p. 102). The arguments in favor of the existence of proper names for particulars, which Geoffrey accepts, mostly defend the existence of singular intellectual knowledge of individuals by reflection (via the imagination, as in the later theory of Thomas Aquinas), which means that the noetic argument against the existence of proper names cannot be upheld. But the problem remains because, for Geoffrey, intellection is not the significate of the name; rather, it is the form, following Averroes’ interpretation of the semantic theory implied in the Metaphysics, whereby names signify the form primarily, and secondarily the aggregate. Since there is no form for individuals, the latter cannot properly be named. Geoffrey’s solution means that individuals do have ordinary proper names, but not logically proper names, i.e., names that are truly proper names for individuals and truly names. In his commentary on the Isagoge (Notulae super Porphyrium, provisional edition, courtesy of Alessandro Conti), Robert Kilwardby also says that the individual does have a proper name (proprium nomen), but does not properly have a name (proprie nomen), i.e., a true logical name established on metaphysical grounds. This distinction will also be at the heart of the theory proposed by John Buridan in the following century.

5. Buridan’s Theory of Singular Terms and its Influence

The fourteenth century witnessed a fresh start on the topic of singular terms, due to some major innovations: the birth of a nominalist logic, the notion of a mental language, and the idea that individuals are intellectually knowable as individuals — an idea defended by Ockham in his theory of intuitive cognition, after an initial breakthrough provided by John Duns Scotus and his theory of haecceity (see SEP “Medieval Theories of Haecceity”). However, Ockham’s logic offers only a sketchy account. Spoken proper names seem to not have any corresponding singular simple concepts to which they could be subordinated in mental language because the corresponding concept becomes universal as soon as the individual known is no longer present to the knower. In order to address this, Claude Panaccio has provided a reconstruction of Ockham’s semantics where it is mental concepts that are subordinated to oral terms in such cases (see Panaccio 2006 (2017)). As for pronouns, they are supposed to be eliminable in mental language even though they play a crucial role, distinct from the one played by proper names. As “direct designators”, pronouns would be meaningless for Ockham according to Panaccio. Faced with the problem of descent from universal to demonstrative singular propositions, Ockham would say that if the subject term is empty (because no individual man is designated), the singular proposition is not a proposition subordinated to the universal proposition (see Panaccio 1980).

John Buridan offers a quite different picture, in which each type of singular term — ‘this man’, ‘Socrates’, and ‘this [one]’ — is thoroughly discussed. The Parisian master produced the most complete and coherent account of singular terms in the Middle Ages and through this exerted a great influence on logic and semantics in the following centuries.

5.1 Buridan on Singular Terms and Concepts

In his commentary on Aristotle’s De anima (III/8), Buridan claims that ‘this man’, which signifies what he calls a “vague individual”, is the most proper singular term. Buridan’s view of vague individuals was related, as was Avicenna’s original discussion (see Black 2011), to Aristotle’s claim in Physics I (184a22–24) that in cognition we proceed from universals to particulars: first we cognize this body, then this animal, then this man (the vague individual), then Socrates (the determinate individual, with all his particular accidental characteristics). The vague individual is just the perfectly individually identified individual, without taking into account all his individual accidents. Indeed, Buridan says that for the vague individual to be ‘vague’ is just “a way of speaking”, since it corresponds to a face-to-face (in prospectu) intellectual cognition. His account allows recognition of both the primacy of singulars and of the move from what is more to what is less general. It depends on Buridan’s epistemological claim that general notions are always involved in apprehension. This has led many scholars to formulate the idea that what makes an apprehension singular is the confusion or fusing together of circumstances, so that being a man is not something abstracted from what exists here and now in such and such a way. Singularity is not tied to the absence of generality, but rather to the presence of confusion or lack of discrimination. A concept can be semantically simple and singular but at the same time metaphysically rich (see Miller 1985; Van der Lecq 1993; King 2001, Ashworth 2004a, Klima 2009). In the case of demonstrative in prospectu concepts, i.e., those involved in the use of indexicals, Buridan often refers to “place” (situs) as the characteristic that accompanies the intellection, making it confused and singular.

John Dorp rejected Buridan’s account, arguing that there is no singular term corresponding to a vague individual in our language. Instead, cognizing a thing as singular involves the cognition of particular circumstances, and the general concept [man] cannot be part of the singular cognition. If we want to introduce vague singulars into our language, we will have to invent some special term, such as ‘a’, to signify Socrates along with a connotation of all the individual circumstances, in which case ‘a’ will count as a vague singular (Compendium, sig. e 1, va-vb). Dorp’s view was not popular. For most later logicians, the vague singular was (contra Dorp) one type of singular term, but (contra Buridan’s claim in the De anima III/8) it is less properly singular than a proper name because it involves some generality.

While it is true that the term ‘this man’ can lack reference through improper use, if it is used properly it must point to one singular existing present object, the very situation in which we form genuinely singular concepts. If it is used without an individual being present, the expression will just not be significant because the pronoun ‘this [one]’ will no longer be significant (Buridan, Quaestiones in Porphyrii, p. 161, or else it will make the proposition false if the individual pointed to is a stone — see below). The term ‘this man’ used several times for different individuals does not make it a common term, but each use is equivocal because a different individual is designated by each token of ‘this man’ (Buridan, In metaphysicen, VII/19, f. 53va). The fact that an individual is being demonstrated here and now means that ‘this man’ is more circumscribed in its proper usage, such that it is always time-bound.

Proper names are a different story. Proper names are sometimes said to be the most proper singular terms by Buridan for this reason (Quaestiones in Porphyrii, p. 162). Buridan remarks that if Socrates leaves the room, he is still Socrates, but he is no longer the referent of ‘this man’ (In Metaphysicen VII/18, f. 53rb). Nevertheless, there are also strict limitations on the use of proper names. Proper names are singular insofar as the concept to which they correspond is itself singular. In his Quaestiones on the Metaphysics VII/20, Buridan considers the names ‘Antichrist’ and ‘Aristotle’, arguing that ‘Antichrist’, the example of a name referring to a person who does not yet exist, is not a singular term because it is formed from ‘anti’ and ‘Christ’ and could apply to more than one individual. There are two possiblities where ‘Aristotle’ is concerned. If I am in the presence of the individual and I dub him ‘Aristotle’, then the name is a genuinely singular term. But if Aristotle is for me merely an historical figure from the distant past, then my concept of Aristotle must be descriptive, containing general elements such as man, great philosopher, born in Greece, and so on. Given that there was in fact only one such man, my concept supposits only for Aristotle and so the stability and uniqueness of my reference is guaranteed. However, since the corresponding concept is not and cannot be singular, it seems that ‘Aristotle’ cannot be a proper singular term when it is uttered by me. Every description is bound to be universal for Buridan, even if it pragmatically permits us to identify and re-identify a single individual (see Ashworth 2004a; Klima 2009, p. 69–89). Most of the proper names we articulate would thus not be singular terms, but only disguised descriptions. Buridan is keen to say that proper names do not pick out their referents according to any descriptive content (Quaestiones super octos libros Physicorum, p. 69). No one can bestow a singular concept upon another person by definition or explanation. As a consequence, the use of proper names as real singular terms also seems quite limited.

Buridan also considers a third case concerning isolated pronouns such as ‘this [one]’. One pending issue is then the way the pronoun combines with ‘man’ in ‘this man’. As seen above, ‘hic’ in Latin is always a demonstrative pronoun. If the expression ‘this man’ is complex, then its significate would depend on the significate of two categorematic terms, ‘this[one]’ and ‘man’, and the supposition would be their intersecting set — an idea actually defended by Buridan in some texts (see Quaestiones in Porphyrii, p. 160; In metaphysicen VII, 19; adopted by Klima 2009, p. 103). If, on the other hand, the expression is simple, as seems to be required by Buridan’s theory of substantial singular terms (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2016), then the pronoun would be treated as a syncategorematic term. But this solution is inconsistent with the fact that pronouns can be used by themselves to refer to individuals. The latter theory was indeed not adopted by Buridan, though it was articulated by Dorp, who hypothesized the unformulated presence of sortals associated with pronouns used in this way (see Ashworth 2004a). Ockham also had a syncategorematic interpretation of pronouns (see Panaccio 1980).The case of pronouns was not a side topic for Buridan, since they are at the heart of his logic, providing the basis for the analysis of the supposition and verification of all other terms (see Brumberg-Chaumont 2016). When used by themselves, pronouns have the same requirement regarding the presence here and now of their referent as expressions such as ‘this man’, and, consequently, they seem to have the same very limited use.

An additional difficulty arises from the fact that singular terms such as ‘Socrates’ need to be non-connotative terms in the category of substance in order to play their fundamental role in supposition and verification (see Summulae de suppositionibus, p. 16, 23, 31; Brumberg-Chaumont 2016). This applies not only to proper names such as ‘Socrates’ and expressions such as ‘this man’, which are officially listed by Buridan as singular simple terms in the category of substance, signifying the individual “without any extrinsic connotation” (Quaestiones in predicamenta, p. 9; Quaestiones Libri Porphyrii, p. 169), but also to pronouns, as the basis for any chain of categorial predication. As noticed by Peter King (King 1994, p. 26), Buridan thought that pronouns signify the substance alone, without any properties (In metaphysicen VII/19). This was in keeping with the grammatical tradition, and it suggested that pronouns signify substances as substances, beyond simply referring to substances. This point presents a problem, however, namely the possibility of the existence of a concept that would be both singular and non-connotative in the category of substance (there are few absolute terms in the category of accidents; an example would be ‘whiteness’). This possibility seems to be precluded by the standard interpretation of Buridan’s theory of intellectual cognition described above, in which a there is a necessary connection between distinction and universality on the one hand (which explains why sensory cognition cannot be universal), and confusion and singularity on the other hand. Applied to ‘Socrates’, this would mean that if the proper name were to signify the determinate individual described in Buridan’s De anima III/8 (as suggested by King 2001, p. 16, Reina 2002, p. 220–255), i.e., an individual substance with all its accidental features, then the corresponding concept would all its individal accidents. Applied to the demonstrative in propectu cognition corresponding to ‘this [one]’ and the vague individual ‘this man’, this would mean that the corresponding concepts would contain at least the aspect of place (situs), which is definitely an accidental property according to the Categories. Every singular term would then be a connotative term — an idea quite disastrous from the point of view of Buridan’s logic.

Answers to each of these difficulties can in fact be found in Buridan’s works.

5.2 Extended Uses of Singular Terms and Non-Connotative (Non-Rich) Singular Concepts

A first element is the fact that the in propectu cognition is a richer notion than the knowledge of something as presently demonstrated here and now, as implied by the special case of deictic expressions (Quaestiones in Porphyrii, p. 160–161). Contrary to Ockham’s intuitive cognition, Buridan’s in prospectu concepts admit situations where individuals are not physically present, but seen in dreams (where they can even be fictitious) or remembered by the knower (In metaphysicen VII/20). Once you have had an in prospectu cognition of the individual named, you can use the proper name, whether the individual is present to you or not. With regard to the in prospectu knowledge attached to the use of proper names, Buridan often speaks of in propectu knowledge “according to the mode of existing in front of the knower” (see for instance De anima III/8; see Miller 1985, Van der Lecq 1993, Reina 2002, pp. 198 ff., King 1994, King 2001, Klima 2009, pp.74–86; Mora-Márquez 2019). A further extension of the use of proper names is possible. As shown by Jennifer Ashworth (Ashworth 2004a), Buridan admits the possibility of using proper names in connection with the impositor’s singular cognition — rather than one’s own cognition. Buridan remarks that I can treat ‘Aristotle’ as a singular term because I believe that the name was imposed or given its signification by someone who did have the appropriate singular concept (In metaphysicen VII/20). If I have never been acquainted with Aristotle but I am speaking with someone who is, we can both be taken to be using a proper name when we utter the word ‘Aristotle’. Buridan’s remarks can be analyzed in at least two closely related ways. On the one hand, given his references to an original baptism or name-giving ceremony, we can regard Buridan as offering an early hint of the historical chain theory of proper names developed by Kripke. On the other hand, given his apparent recognition that the speaker’s intention to refer to the person so named is related to a body of information which, whether accurate or not, is causally connected with the person baptized as ‘Aristotle’, perhaps Buridan’s view is closer to the causal account given by Gareth Evans. As Gyula Klima puts it, the appeal to the “second user” is “parasitic” on the “primary user” (Klima 2011, p. 68). Buridan’s hints were picked up, though not developed, by later authors. For instance, Dorp remarked that we treat ‘Aristotle’ as singular because it was singular for the original impositor.

The importance of some sort of causal link between the original producer of the name and the named individual as well as its relation to the representative nature of singular concepts was brought out by Buridan and Dorp in their discussion of two cases. In the first case, Plato and Socrates are exactly similar but, without my knowing it, one replaces the other in my field of vision. Buridan (Quaestiones super octos libros Physicorum I/7, In metaphysicen VII/17) and Dorp (Compendium, sig. e 2rb) argue that while my first-formed singular concept is equally similar to both individuals, i.e., Plato and Socrates, it is not a concept of Socrates (the second individual) because it is caused by a different individual. The criterion of distinction is not the fit between concept and object but the causal relation. The second case was discussed by Dorp alone (Compendium, sig. e 2rb). If identical twins are born and both are called ‘Socrates’, it may seem that ‘Socrates’ will thereby function as a common name because the two concepts will be exactly alike. But here too the causal relation is what is important, and so for Dorp this is an example of two singular terms, each with its own signification (see Asthworth 2004a, p. 138).

An extended use can also be envisaged for pronouns, whether occurring alone or in expressions such as ‘this man’. A passage from the commentary on the Metaphysics (In metaphysicen VII/19) shows that Buridan accepts and indeed, for the sake of the coherence of his logical theory, encourages the idea that pronouns could be used by someone to refer to something that could be designated by pointing. This de-indexicalized use of pronouns is mobilized by Buridan in specific philosophical contexts, such as when Aristotle says that primary substances signify ‘this something’ (hoc aliquid). The point is very important, because Buridan believes that if taken “in the proper sense” (de vitute sermonis), any inference from a universal proposition to a subordinate proposition with a singular term such as ‘this man’ is invalid, because the antecedent can be true and the consequent false, such as when I point to a stone (In metaphysicen VII/19, f. 53vb). Logical and philosophical uses of language are contexts in which you should admit de-indexicalized uses of pronouns, that is, uses connected to the potential designation of a thing by someone (whether by myself or another speaker), “as if [something] were to be shown by someone [about which] she could truly say, ‘this thing is a this something’ (si ab aliquo esset demonstrata ipse posset dicere vere ‘hec res est hoc aliquid’)” (for further discussion, see Brumberg-Chaumont 2016).

What about the connotative nature of singular terms and concepts? It should be said here that proper names are probably not to be generally described as signifying “determinate individuals”, as suggested by the reading of De anima III/8. This idea, which is simply incompatible with Buridan’s rejection of descriptive content in the standard analysis of the semantics of proper names, is avoided by Gyula Klima’s interpretation (Klima 2009, pp. 111 ff.) . In addition, the arguments derived by the standard interpretation against the existence of a concept that would be both singular and non-connotative (not rich) can be overcome by looking more closely at another passage from Buridan’s commentary on the Metaphysics (In metaphysicen VII/17). Here Buridan says that a single substantive feature inside the complex of data contained in an intellection based on in propectu knowledge can be isolated from accidents, including place. Buridan’s solution for “substantial terms in the category of substance” (termini substantiales de predicamento substantie), whether singular or universal, is the following: “Because the intellect can detach (absolvere) the concept of the subject from the concept of an accident, when we impose [a term], we can have the intention to detach it, so that the term does not connote the accidents.” This applies to singular substantial terms in the category of substance: “A purely singular concept needs the thing to appear in front of (in prospectu) the one who knows. In this way, someone who knows forms an individual concept of the substance [on the one hand] and of the accidents [on the other], and can impose a singular name [on each] in an independent way” (In metaphysicen VII/17, f. 50ra-rb). This solution explains how one can consider the individual substance on its own without the cognition being turned into a universal concept. As a substantial name in the category of substance, a proper name can be imposed only according to this isolated feature, i.e., ‘Socrates’ can be imposed on Socrates as a substance, irrespective of the other features he presents to the intellect. The concept and the corresponding term can both be singular and substantial. The isolation being appealed to here does not mean that we end up with an abstract concept, detached from the in prospectu cognition (otherwise it would not be singular anymore), but rather, it is isolated within the in prospectu cognition (for further discussion, see Brumberg-Chaumont 2016). Very interesting discussions on the same topic are found in Marsilius of Inghen and Thuo of Vitborg (Bos 1999). The same kind of solution can and indeed must go for demonstrative concepts corresponding to ‘this man’ and ‘this[one]’. This would explain why Buridan says that pronouns do not signify substance with accidents, despite the fact that substances always appear with accidents in demonstrative in prospectu cognitions (if only with the accident of place). If proper names can sometimes be associated with individualizing accidents attached to a single individual (as suggested by De anima III/8), this does not mean that the proper name signifies such accidents. The name can be imposed on individual substances only as designated by ‘this [one]’ (as in, “let this one be named ‘Socrates”), the demonstrative term being a substantial singular term based on a substantive singular concept in which even place has been removed from consideration.

5.3 Proper Names and Identity Through Time

In the last redaction of his commentary on Aristotle’s Physics (I,10), Buridan asks the question “Is Socrates the same today that he was yesterday?”, with important consequences for proper names. In his answer, Buridan carefully distinguishes between three kinds of numerical identity through time, a strictest sense (God), a strict sense (for individuals unified by a rational soul such as Socrates) and a less strict sense (for bodies and other realites like rivers). A consequence of Buridan’s account is that names such as ‘Socrates’ and ‘Aristotle’ on the one hand, and the river ‘Seine’ and ‘Browny’ the donkey on the other, have a different status. The former are more properly singular terms than the latter, even for those acquainted with these individuals through time. Domingo de Soto was strongly opposed to this consequence. He appeals to Aristotle in order to argue that continuity of soul is not the only criterion for identity of the second type, and that horses, trees, and even rivers could possess this stronger identity by virtue of the continuity of their forms and functions, which is the basis on which a singular concept is applied to them over time. Another consequence of Buridan’s account is found in some early sixteenth-century logicians who adopted an even more restrictive account of proper names (see Astworth 2004a, pp. 139–140). These logicians argued that a sequence of different concepts of Socrates will be formed over time, even by one acquainted with him, and hence the name ‘Socrates’ is no more a proper singular term than the name ‘Seine’. Names are radically equivocal, since at every moment they are subordinated to different concepts. Nor is this incompatible with the intention of the person who originally gave Socrates his name. Strictly speaking, only the baby was called ‘Socrates’, but the name was imposed equivalently or as a consequence to signify every successor to the boy by means of different concepts. Once more, Domingo de Soto (Summule ff. 18vb-19rb) was strongly opposed. He said that to regard the name ‘Socrates’ as an equivocal term referring to a succession of individuals is a rejection of common speech and the common sense of the wise men who originally gave such terms their signification. Identity of the second type is sufficiently strong to be the basis for a singular concept to be predicated non-ambiguously over time.

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