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In their monumental, three-volume work Principia Mathematica, Whitehead and Russell develop logicism in a slightly different way. They identify numbers with propositional functions which, owing to unclarity of exposition, hover between properties, on the one hand, and linguistic expressions (open sentences, predicates roughly), on the other. But they quantify over propositional functions in a way that treats them as properties, so this early version of logicism actually identifies numbers with properties rather than with sets. Whitehead and Russell don't make use of the intensionality of properties, however, and they could as well have used sets. More recently several philosophers, particularly Bealer (1982, ch 5-6; cf. Menzel, 1986) have argued that logic alone guarantees the existence of enough properties with the right structure to play the role of the natural numbers. This requires a conception of logic much richer than many traditional ones; among other things, logic alone must ensure the existence of infinitely many things (such systems, which are quite intricate, are beyond the scope of the present article, but a few of the basic ideas are explained in §8).
Champions of a logicism based on properties can simply adapt earlier identificationist's explanations of truth, objectivity, and logical form, substituting properties for the sets employed in the earlier accounts. Moreover, they can hold that the existence of properties, at least those identified with the numbers, is guaranteed by logic. And since logical truths are necessarily true, these properties necessarily exist and they necessarily stand in the (mathematically relevant) relations that they do, which explains the modal status of arithmetic claims. None of this tells us how mathematical knowledge is possible; any account of this will require substantive auxiliary hypotheses about human cognitive faculties.
This brief account of property-theoretic versions of logicism can't do justice to their details, but it tells us enough to spot several likely objections to them. They face problems peculiar to logicism as well as more general problems that threaten most versions of identificationism.
A second traditional hallmark of logic is that it does not make existence commitments, at least not any specific ones. It is true that theorems of our most familiar logical system, first-order logic, are only true in circumstances in which at least one thing exists. But this one thing can be any sort of thing at all, and this system is sometimes criticized for assuming even this much (this is one reason why some philosophers prefer free logic, which doesn't make even this minimal commitment). In the end, though, it is less important to decide whether rich and powerful systems count as logic than to see whether they have the sorts of features that make logicism attractive in the first place.
It may seem plausible to view theorems of classical sentential logic as analytic, true in virtue of the meanings of the logical constants they contain. But it is generally agreed that existence claims are not analytic (this is the root of the problem with the ontological argument). So the nice, intuitive view that mathematical knowledge is no great mystery (it's simply knowledge of analytic logical truths) seems less plausible once the notion of logic is stretched to become so powerful. Moreover, this stretching doesn't end with the requirement that our logic of properties guarantee the existence of infinitely many things. First-order logic is not strong enough to characterize the natural numbers even up to isomorphism, and logics that are do not have recursively enumerable sets of logical truths (by Gödel's theorem). Hence, such systems are epistemically untractable in the sense that their truths far outrun our ability to track (prove) them.
In short, it may well be a merely verbal dispute just which formal systems merit the honorific title of `logic'. The substantive point here is that if logicism requires a logic that is so lavish in its existence commitments and so computationally (and hence epistemologically) unruly, then the appeal that the slogan "truths of arithmetic are just truths of logic" had when we had a kinder and gentler vision of logic in mind begins to fade. Indeed, as we will now see, logicist identificationism does not turn out to be so very terribly different from its non-logicist counterparts.
The claim that numbers are identical with sets is really all we need to mobilize the logicist's accounts of mathematical truth, objectivity, and logical form. Furthermore, since the sets identified with numbers are all pure sets (they don't have any members that aren't themselves sets), it can be argued that they exist necessarily, which explains the modal status of mathematical claims. The important point here is that a property theorist can write a set of axioms for property theory that parallel the axioms of standard set theories (save for replacing the axiom of extensionality with some other identity condition, perhaps omitting the axiom of foundations, and making other minor emendations to adapt the ideas better to properties; e.g., Jubien, 1989; cf. Pollard and Martin, 1986). The resulting axioms are not viewed as part of logic, but as a characterization of an independently existing realm of properties. And once this is done, the property theorist can adapt the explanations given by those non-logicists who identify numbers with sets to explain all of the items on our list except for the one involving mathematical knowledge.
Modality It isn't clear that N-relation theorists are any better off than regularity theorists when it comes to explaining the modal features of laws. If it is a contingent matter, as most aver, which first-order properties stand in the N-relation, then this relation doesn't link those properties because of what those properties are like; it just happens to link some properties in the actual world, and it could link completely different properties in other possible circumstances. On this account light could have had the phenomenal properties of molasses, photons the mass of the solar system, and two quite different kinds of elementary particles could retain their identities while swapping all their quantum numbers.
The reason why modality is a problem for such N-relation theorists is that you cannot infer a genuine nomological must from an is (although you may be able to contrive some sort of ersatz must). If we want genuine modal force to fall out at the end, we have to build it in at the beginning, and on N-relation accounts there is no place to put it except in the N-relation itself. We might do this by holding that the N- relation links the same properties in every nomologically possible world, but without an independent characterization of nomological possibility this doesn't illuminate the nature of laws. So it can be tempting, as a sort of last resort, to conclude that the necessity involved is a very strong, metaphysical necessity. If we do build such a strong necessity into the N relation, so that if it actually relates two properties, it necessarily does so, we can explain the modal force of laws. But in accordance with the fundamental ontological tradeoff, investing the N-relation with this strong modal force raises the epistemic cost.
Confirmation If laws involve a metaphysical relation holding among properties, it may be more difficult to determine when an observed regularity is actually backed by a law. N-relation theorists may urge that we do this using whatever methods actual scientists employ. But argument is required to show that such methods actually give us reasons to believe that there are laws with the strong features that N-relation theorists suppose, rather than merely supplying reasons to draw the weaker sorts of conclusions proposed by regularity theorists.
A Nice Sharp Line It is far from clear that there is a sharp line between laws non-laws. Indeed, we often talk as though some laws (e.g., various conservation laws) are very fundamental and robust, while other laws (e.g., Kepler's laws) are less so.
Explanation We often (indeed very often, outside fundamental physics) explain things by citing the causal mechanisms and processes they involve rather than by subsuming them under general laws. For example, we do not explain why all crows are black by saying (in some more idiomatic way) that the N-relation holds between the properties being a crow and being black. We explain it by finding causal (in this case genetic) mechanisms that link the two properties. In other cases we appeal to a deeper theory, e.g., we explain why Kepler's laws hold (to the extent that they do) by deriving (approximations of) them from Newton's laws.
First posted: September 23, 1999
Last modified: September 23, 1999