Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Game Theory
Game theory is the mathematical theory of bargaining, the essentials
of which were developed by John Von Neumann and Oskar Morgenstern in
their book The Theory of Games and Economic Behavior
(1947). Von Neumann and Morgenstern restricted their attention to
zero-sum games, that is, to games in which no player can gain except
at another’s expense. However, this restriction was overcome by the
work of John Nash during the 1950s. Contemporary game theorists search
for so-called Nash equilibria, that is, sets of strategies used
by the 1 to n players in a game such that, for each agent
i, given the strategies of the other players, i has no
incentive to change her strategy. Nash equilibria are stable, but not
necessarily desirable; for example, in what is undoubtedly the
best-known and most-discussed instance of a game, the Prisoner’s
Dilemma, the unique Nash equilibrium is a state in which both of the
two players are as badly off, given their utility functions, as
possible. The point of Game Theory, then, is not prescriptive but
descriptive: analysis of a game permits us to locate the equilibria,
and thus to predict those states of play which will be stable, barring
exogenous interference. For stipulative purposes, it is usual to say
that the intervention of such an exogenous force changes the
game. Thus, if some social situation had the structure of a Prisoner’s
Dilemma, and the government passed a law prohibiting use by players of
the strategies that lead to the sub-optimal (in the usual parlance,
Pareto-dominated; see below for the intuitions behind this
concept) outcomes, then we should not say that the society in question
faced a Prisoner’s Dilemma, but managed to find the Pareto-superior
outcome; rather, we should say that the introduction of the government
as a player changed the game, so that it was no longer an instance of
the Prisoner’s Dilemma.
Why are philosophers increasingly becoming interested in Game Theory?
One answer is that it has provided us with a formal way of
representing a type of logical difficulty which Plato noted in his
discussion of justice in the Republic, but which received its
first sustained treatment in Hobbes’s Leviathan. Re-reading
Hobbes through the lens of Game Theory, we can now reconstruct his
argument for absolute monarchy as follows. If there are no external
constraints on people’s behavior, then achieving co-ordination is
impossible unless everyone acts so as to maximize not their own
welfare, but that of society as a whole. We may grant that there are
such natural altruists, perhaps even many of them. However, if there
are any narrowly self-interested agents about, then they will exploit
the altruists’ constraints, profiting from the unselfish behavior of
the altruists while also profiting from their own absence of
constraint. It would be psychologically un-natural, Hobbes argues, for
the altruists to long put up with this. But their only way of
responding is to abandon their own constraints. Thus, Hobbes
concludes, moral dispositions are unstable enforcers of social
cooperation: a mechanism of enforcement can only work if no one can
escape from its bonds when it is convenient for them to do so. Hence
Hobbes’s conclusion that if people wish to live in social order, which
appears to be a biological necessity, then they must entrust
enforcement to a sovereign, who then operates with absolute power of
enforcement.
Hobbes, of course, pushes his argument further, maintaining that
sovreignty must be indivisble. He thus rejects democracy as a viable
enforcement mechanism. We shall not concern ourselves with this
further argument here, which appears partly to rest on a false
dichotomy: when Hobbes speaks of democracy, he seems to have only the
unregulated democracies of the ancient world before him as examples;
the possibility that a constitution could bind government and governed
alike appears (unsurprisingly) not to have occurred to him. But his
central point continues to carry much force. Indeed, modern economics
and game theory can help us to see that it has more force than Hobbes
supposed. Hobbes’s argument involves a questionable psychological
premise to the effect that most people are narrowly
self-interested. But this premise is unnecessarily strong. To see why,
let us consider the notion of a utility function.
We begin with a preliminary concept, that of a
preference-ordering. Following Paul Samuelson, we will regard
preference-orderings as revealed by behavior. That is to say,
imagine that each agent were presented with a set of possible states
of the world, or bundles, and the opportunity to trade bundles
with other agents. The agent would reveal her preferences among
bundles by swapping some for others. Eventually, as evidence
accumulates, we can construct, for each agent, an ordered list,
placing her most preferred bundle at the top, and proceeding downwards
to her least-preferred bundle. Note that she will likely be
indifferent in her preferences amongst many bundles; these will be
ranked together as indifference sets. Then the construction of
an ordinal utility function is straightforward: we simply
number her indifference-sets, from top to bottom, with real numbers 1
to n. We call this function ordinal because no
properties of the numbers matter except their order; thus, an ordinal
utility function does not capture relative intensities amongst
preferences. However, we can cardinalize these functions, so
that intensities are represented, by means of the following
trick. Present the agent with choices of gambles over lotteries
amongst the elements in her preference ordering, where each gamble
must be purchased in a uniform currency (say, money). Then we may
examine the ratios between the probabilities associated with her
maximizing the acquisition of bundles high on her ordinal utility
function and the amounts she is willing to pay for each gamble, and
derive her cardinal utility function from these ratios.
Now let us return to the Hobbesian dilemma. Game Theory permits us to
show, mathematically, that that dilemma can arise even in a population
consisting entirely of altruists. Suppose that everyone’s
most-preferred bundle was one in which all of the world’s surplus food
went to the starving children of some impoverished country; that all
favoured a different country’s children; and that all preferred that
some country should have its children fed rather than none. These
agents are surely altruistic, in any normal sense of the word. But,
having conflicting utility functions, they must bargain with one
another. Suppose that all know that their own contribution alone would
make no significant difference, and that all attach some value
to consuming their own food. Then the Hobbesian nightmare is possible
among these saintly agents, and Game Theory can prove it. As Nash
showed in his series of papers (without specific reference to this
scenario I invented) there exists an assignment of possible utility
functions to these agents, consistent with the story as told, such
that the only equilibrium strategy for each agent would be to threaten
to withhold their own food unless others contributed to their
preferred country. In that case, we would have an instance of a
Hobbesian social dilemma: the only equilibrium in the game
would be one in which all of the children starve, despite the fact
that all of the agents prefer an outcome in which at least some
children are saved (in the technical parlance, the unique
Nash-equilibrium would be Pareto-dominated by another state of
affairs).
The fascination of Game Theory emerges from the fact that it shows us
how we cannot simply derive conclusions about outcomes in competitive
settings from psychological facts about the competitors. The intuitive
reason for this is straightforward. Our imagined agents are neither
selfish nor irrational. But the choice of strategy for each agent is
constrained by both scarcity - the basic insight on which all
economics rests - and by the utility functions of the other
agents with whom they are competing. The complete set of utility
functions, along with specifications about the extent to which the
agents are privy to one another’s utility functions, determines
the equilbrium strategies available to them. Our altruists in the
scenario imagined above are trapped by the logic of the game in which
they find themselves; only an external force - say, a UN decree that
food shall go either and only to Mexico or to India - could get them
out of their social dilemma, by changing the game in which they find
themselves.
Having provided motivation for a description of the basic point of
Game Theory, we will now set out to define a game. Our presentation
will follow that of Ross and LaCasse (1995), which employs a standard
textbook definition. We will begin by informally defining the
elements of the formal definition, and then provide the formal
definition itself.
First, the informal definition. Consider an initial allocation
of resources distributed among a finite set of Dennettian
agents. A Dennettian agent is a unit that acts, where an
act is any move that potentially influences future allocations. The
qualifier Denettian here is in acknowledgement of Daniel
Dennett’s careful separation, over a large body of work, of the
concept of agency, on the one hand, and the concepts of
deliberation and consciousness, on the other. (See the article by Don
Ross, mentioned in the Bibliography below, which explains this
fully.) A Dennettian agent, then, is an actor that is not
necessarily presumed to be either deliberative or conscious. (This is
important in order to respect the full range of applications of Game
Theory; see below.) Now, then: a game is a set of acts by 1
to n rational Dennettian agents (with what is meant by
rational to be specified below), and, possibly, an arational
Dennettian agent (a random mechanism) called nature, where at
least one Dennettian agent (henceforth, a DA) has control over the
outcome of the set of acts, and where the DAs are potentially in
conflict, in the sense that one DA could rank outcomes differently
from the others. A strategy for a particular DA i is a
vector that specifies the acts that i will take in response to
all possible acts by other agents. A DA i is rational
iff, for given strategies of other agents, the set of acts specified
by i’s strategy is such that it secures the available
consequence which is most highly ranked by i. Nature
is a generator of pobabilistic influences on outcomes; technically it
is the unique DA in a game that is not rational. An outcome is
an allocation of resources which results from the acts of the DAs. A
DA i has control if a change in i’s acts is
sufficient to change the outcome for at least one vector of
strategies for the other DAs. A consequence for i is
the value for i of a function that maps outcomes onto the real
numbers, interpreted as representing either an ordinal or a cardinal
utility function for i.
Games may be represented either in extensive form, that is,
using a "tree" structure of the sort that is familiar to
decision theorists, where each player’s strategy is a path through the
tree, or in strategic form. The significance of this
distinstion will be discussed below. A game in strategic form is a
list:
G = {N, S, 
(s)}
where
- N is the set of players, and the index i designates
a particular agent i
N = {0, 1, 2, 3 ... n};
- S is the strategy space for the agents S = Xni=0Si where Si is the set
of all possible strategies for i;
- (s) is a vector of payoff
functions, one for each agent, excluding player 0. Each payoff function
specifies the consequences, for the agent in question, of the strategies
specified for all agents:
(s) = (1(s), ...,
n(s)); : S
n
Given that game outcomes are determined by the agents’ acts, and given
that these acts are specified by their strategies, it follows that
specification of a function f(·) together with
strategies implies the existence of the vector of payoff functions
(s). The payoff
functions provide, for each vector of strategies in S, a vector
of n real numbers in n representing the consequences for all
players.
The above definition leaves entirely open the dynamics of the game.
That is, it abstracts from questions which are often of fundamental
importance in applying Game Theory to actual situations. The most
significant aspect of dynamics is information exchange: How much do
particular players know about the strategies of other players? To
incorporate imperfect information into a game, one must represent it
in extensive form. An extensive-form game looks precisely like the
familiar trees of decision theorists: branching structures through
sets of nodes which converge to an upper apex, represetning the
outcome. However, the interpretation of the tree is quite different
from that applied to a decision tree. Nodes do not represent decision
points, at which players estimate probabilities and then choose
options; rather, they represent acts, as defined above. One has not
fully specified a game in extensive form until one has completely
identified each player’s path through the tree, and indicating which
at which nodes subsets of players share information. Ken Binmore’s
Fun and Games is an excellent manual on constructing
extensive-form games; see Bibliography below. Following Binmore’s
technique, one isolates information-sets by drawing oblong boxes
around the nodes where information is common. Again, note that such
incorporation does not turn games into decision-trees, in the sense
that agents’ options at each node are open. One has not specified a
game until one has specified the set of strategies; and since to
specify an agent’s strategy determines her path through the tree, the
game itself remains a static object. The chief difference, then,
between strategic-form and extensive-form representations of games is
that in the latter cases, but not the former, retrospective dynamics
are indicated. From an extensive-form representation of a game, a
unique strategic-form representation follows, but a given
strategic-form representation could have been generated from any one
of several possible extensive forms. Whereas there is no controversy
as to when different strategic forms represent tokens of the same
game, the identity conditions on games in extensive form are not so
clear. This is a philosophical and mathematical problem on which the
present author is currently working; suggestions from interested
readers would be most welcome!
Game theory has, of course, been extensively used in microeconomic
analysis, where its record of accurate predictions has been impressive
in areas such as industrial organization theory, the theory of the
firm, and auction theory. In macroeconomics and political science its
use has been more controversial, since in such applications it is
often difficult to establish that the specified game is in fact an
accurate representation of the empirical phenomenon being
modelled. For example, it has been commonplace to suggest that the
nuclear standoff between the United States and the Soviet Union during
the Cold War was a case of the Prisoner’s Dilemma. However, it is far
from obvious that the leaderships in either country in fact attached
the necessary payoffs in their utility functions - preferring the
destruction of the world to their own unique destruction - that would
have been required for their situation to have been an actual
PD. (Indeed, since according to revealed preference theory utility
functions are inferred from actual choice behaviour, the fact that we
are still here is convincing evidence that this analysis was
mistaken.) Game Theory has also been fruitfully applied in
evolutionary biology, where species and/or genes are treated as
players. (This is a particular instance of the general fact that
agents in games are not necessarily assumed to be deliberators; this
is another respect in which game theory differs from decision theory.)
Evolutionary game-theorists search for evolutionary stable strategies
(SSR’s), that is, of behavioral and morphological dispositions among
competing organisms that may facilitate predictions of the
distribution of such dispositions in a given environment. The concept
of an SSR is conceptually similar to that of a Nash equilibrium, but
not mathematically identical; an important area of contemporary work
involves trying to establish this relationship with greater precision.
For a compendium of what has been achieved in this area, see
J. Weibull (1995). Ideally, philosophers and scientists in many
disciplines could profit from development of a truly general theory of
informational dynamics that incorporated the aspect of competition
treated by game theory. Philosophers are most likely to have
encountered game-theoretic analysis as a result of its use by some
moral philosophers, particularly David Gauthier (see the discussion of
literature below), to attempt to show that morally constrained agents
are more likely to escape Pareto-dominated outcomes in competitive
games than are agents constrained only by rationality (in the strict
economic sense of ‘rationality’). Relatively few philosophers,
however, appear to be persuaded that this claim is true. Of course,
players may try to avoid Pareto-dominated outcomes by constraining
their available strategies through resort to a Hobbesian enforcement
mechanism. The point of such a mechanism, however, is to allow groups
of players to avoid Pareto-dominated outcomes despite their amorality,
rather than because of it.
- Binmore, 1992, Fun and Games, D. C. Heath
- Binmore, Kirman, and Tani, (eds.), 1993, Frontiers of Game
Theory, MIT Press
- Binmore, 1994, Game Theory and the Social Contract (v. 1):
Playing Fair, MIT Press
- Danielson, 1992, Artificial Morality, Routledge
- Danielson, (ed.), 1997, Modelling Rational and Moral Agents,
Oxford University Press
- Fudenberg and Tirole, 1991, Game Theory, MIT Press
- Gauthier, 1986, Morals By Agreement, Oxford University Press
- Maynard Smith, 1982, Evolution and the Theory of Games, Cambridge University Press
- Ross, 1994, ‘Dennett’s Conceptual Reform’, Behaviour and Philosophy 22: 41-52
- Ross and LaCasse, 1995, ‘Towards a New Philosophy of Positive Economics’, Dialogue XXXIV/3 (Summer): 467-493
- Skyrms, 1996, The Evolution of the Social Contract, Cambridge
University Press
- Vallentyne, (ed.), 1991, Contractarianism and Rational Choice, Cambridge University Press
- von Neumann and Morgenstern, 1947, The Theory of Games and Economic Behavior, Princeton University Press, 2nd edition
- Weibull, 1995, Evolutionary Game Theory, MIT Press
A reader looking for a tour of the most exciting conceptual issues
and applications in Game Theory, which is not mathematically
demanding, could not do better than Skyrms (1996), which is much more
wide-ranging in the issues it covers than its title suggests. Binmore
(1992) is an accessible, though slightly idiosyncratic, introduction
to game theory. Fudenberg and Tirole (1991) is a very thorough
mathematical text. For recent developments in fundamental theory,
see Binmore, Kirman and Tani (1993). Ross (1994) and Ross &
LaCasse (1995) explain the concept of a Dennettian agent, as used
above. Evolutionary game theory owes its genesis to Maynard Smith
(1982). Gauthier’s application of game theory to moral philosophy
occurs in Gauthier (1986), and is extended in Danielson (1992). For
critical discussions of this enterprise, see Vallentyne (1991) and
Danielson (forthcoming 1997). Many philosophers will also be
interested in Binmore (1994), which attempts to show that application
of game-theoretic analysis can underwrite a loosely Rawlsian theory
of justice that does not require recourse to Kantian presuppositions
about what rational agents would desire behind a veil of ignorance
concerning their identities and social roles.
prisoner’s dilemma |
rationality
Acknowledgements
The contribution of Chantale LaCasse to the material in Section 2 is
gratefully acknowledged.
Copyright © 1997 by
Don Ross
University of Cape Town
dross@SOCSCI.UCT.AC.ZA
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Table of Contents
First published: January 25, 1997
Content last modified: September 15, 1997