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Supertasks
Supertasks have posed problems for philosophy since the time of Zeno
of Elea. The term ‘supertask’ is new but it designates an idea
already present in the formulation of the old motion paradoxes of
Zeno, namely the idea of an infinite number of actions performed in a
finite amount of time. The main problem lies in deciding what follows
from the performance of a supertask. Some philosophers have claimed
that what follows is a contradiction and that supertasks are,
therefore, logically impossible. Others have denied this conclusion,
and hold that the study of supertasks can help us improve our
understanding of the physical world, or even our theories about it.
1.1: Definitions
A supertask may be defined as an infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. The terms
‘action’ and ‘operation’ must not be understood in their usual sense,
which involves a human agent. Human agency may be involved but it is
not necessary. To show this, let us see how actions can be
characterised precisely without any references to man. We will assume
that at each instant of time the state of the world relevant to a
specific action can be described by a set S of sentences. Now an
action or operation applied to a state of the world results in a
change in that state, that is, in the set S corresponding to it.
Consequently, an arbitrary action a will be defined (Allis and
Koetsier [1995]) as a change in the state of the world by which the
latter changes from state S before the change to state a(S) after it.
This means that an action has a beginning and an end, but does not
entail that there is a finite lapse of time between them. For
instance, take the case of a lamp that is on at t = 0 and remains so
until t = 1, an instant at which it suddenly goes off. Before t =1
the state of the lamp (which is the only relevant portion of the world
here) can be described by the sentence ‘lamp on’, and after t =1 by
the sentence ‘lamp off’, without there being a finite lapse of time
between the beginning and the end of the action. Some authors have
objected to this consequence of the definition of action, and they
might be right if we were dealing with the general philosophical
problem of change. But we need not be concerned with those objections
at this stage, since in the greatest majority of the relevant
supertasks instantaneous actions (i.e. actions without any duration)
can be replaced by actions lasting a finite amount of time without
affecting the analysis at any fundamental point.
There is a particular type of supertask called hypertasks. A
hypertask is a non-numerable infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. Therefore, a
supertask which is not a hypertask will be a numerable infinite
sequence of actions or operations carried out in a finite interval of
time. Finally, a task can be defined as a finite sequence of actions
or operations carried out in a finite interval of time.
1.2: The Philosophical Problem of Supertasks
To gain a better insight into the fundamental nature of the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks, consider the distinction
between tasks in general (finite sequences of actions of the type
(a1, a2, a3, . . . , an))
and one particular type of supertasks, namely those consisting of an
infinite sequence of actions of the type (a1,
a2, a3, . . . , an, . . . ) and thus
having the same type of order as the natural order of positive
integers: 1, 2, 3, . . . , n, . . . (it is customary to denote this
type of order with letter ‘w’ and so the related supertasks can
be called supertasks of type w).
In the case of a task T = (a1, a2,
a3, . . . , an) it is natural to say that T is
applicable in state S if:
a1 is applicable to S,
a2 is applicable to a1(S),
a3 is applicable to a2(a1(S)),
. . . , and,
an is applicable to an-1(an-2(. . .
(a2(a1(S))). . . )).
The successive states of the world relevant to task T can be defined
by means of the finite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, a1(S), a2(a1(S)),
a3(a2(a1(S))), . . . ,
an(an-1(an-2
(. . . (a2(a1(S))). . . ))),
whose last term will therefore describe the relevant state of the
world after the performance of T. Or, equivalently, the state
resulting from applying T to S will be T(S) =
an(an-1(an-2
(. . . (a2(a1(S))). . . ))).
Now take the case of a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, . . . , an, . . . ). Let us give the name
Tn to the task which consists in performing the first n
actions of T. That is, Tn = (a1, a2,
a3, . . . , an). Now it is natural to say that
T is applicable in state S if Tn is applicable in S for
each natural number n, and, obviously,
Tn(S) =
an(an-1(an-2
(. . . (a2(a1(S))). . . ))).
The successive states of the world relevant to supertask T can be
described by means of the infinite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, T1(S), T2(S),
. . . , Tn(S), . . .
A difficulty arises, however, when we want to specify the set of
sentences which describe the relevant state of the world after the
performance of supertask T, because the infinite sequence above lacks
a final term. Put equivalently, it is difficult to specify the
relevant state of the world resulting from the application of
supertask T to S because there seems to be no final state resulting
from such an application. This inherent difficulty is increased by
the fact that, by definition, supertask T is performed in a finite
time, and so there must exist one first instant of time t* at which it
can be said that the performance happened. Now notice that the world
must naturally be in a certain specific state at t*, which is the
state resulting from the application of T, but that, nevertheless, we
have serious trouble to specify this state, as we have just seen.
1.3: Supertask: A Fuzzy Concept
Since we have defined supertasks in terms of actions and actions in
terms of changes in the state of the world, there is a basic
indeterminacy regarding what type of processes taking place in time
should be considered supertasks, which is linked to the basic
indeterminacy that there is regarding which type of sets of sentences
are to be allowed in descriptions of the state of the world and which
are not. For this reason, there are some processes that would be
regarded as supertasks by virtually every philosopher and some about
which opinions differ. For an instance of the first sort of process,
take the one known as ‘Thomson’s lamp’. Thomson’s lamp is basically a
device consisting of a lamp and a switch set on an electrical circuit.
The switch can be in one of just two positions and the lamp has got to
be lit -when the switch is in position ‘on’- or else dim -when the
switch is in position ‘off’. Assume that initially (at t = 12 A.M.,
say) the lamp is dim and that it is thenceforth subject to the
following infinite sequence of actions: when half of the time
remaining until t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out the action
a1 of turning the switch into position ‘on’ and, as a
result, the lamp is lit (a1 is thus performed at t = 1/2
P.M.); when half the time between the performance of a1 and
t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out action a2 of turning
to the switch into position ‘off’ and, as a result, the lamp is dim
(a2 is thus performed at t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when
half the time between the performance of a2 and t* = 1
P.M. has gone by, we carry out the action of turning the switch into
position ‘on’ and, as a result, the lamp is lit (a3 is thus
performed at t = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8), and so on. When we get to
instant t* = 1 P.M. we will have carried out an infinite sequence of
actions, that is, a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, . . . , an, . . . ). If, for the sake of
simplicity, we are only concerned about the evolution of the lamp (not
the switch) the state of the world relevant to the description of our
supertask admits of only two descriptions, one through the unitary set
of sentences {lamp lit} and the other through the set {lamp dim}.
As an instance of the second sort of processes we referred to above,
those about which no consensus has been reached as to whether they are
supertasks, we can take the process which is described in one of the
forms of Zeno’s dichotomy paradox. Suppose that initially (at t = 12
A.M., say) Achilles is at point A (x = 0) and moving in a
straight line, with a constant velocity v = 1 km/h, towards
point B (x = 1), which is 1 km. away from A. Assume, in
addition, that Achilles does not modify his velocity at any point. In
that case, we can view Achilles’s run as the performance of a
supertask, in the following way: when half the time until t* = 1
P.M. has gone by, Achilles will have carried out the action
a1 of going from point x = 0 to point x =
1/2 (a1 is thus performed in the interval of time
between t =12 A.M. and t = 1/2 P.M.), when half the time from the
end of the performance of a1 until t* = 1 P.M. will have
elapsed, Achilles will have carried out the action a2 of
going from point x = 1/2 to point x = 1/2 +
1/4 (a2 is thus performed in the interval of time
between t = 1/2 P.M. and t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.), when half
the time from the end of the performance of a2 until t* = 1
P.M. will have elapsed, Achilles will have carried out the action
a3 of going from point x = 1/2 + 1/4 to
point x = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 (a3 is thus
performed in the interval of time between t = 1/2 + 1/4
P.M. and t = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so on. When we get
to instant t* = 1 P.M., Achilles will have carried out an infinite
sequence of actions, that is, a supertask T = (a1,
a2, a3, . . . , an, . . . ), provided
we allow the state of the world relevant for the description of T to
be specified, at any arbitrary instant, by a single sentence: the one
which specifies Achilles’s position at that instant. Several
philosophers have objected to this conclusion, arguing that, in
contrast to Thomson’s lamp, Achilles’s run does not involve an
infinity of actions (acts) but of pseudo-acts. In their view, the
analysis presented above for Achilles’s run is nothing but the
breakdown of one process into a numerable infinity of subprocesses,
which does not make it into a supertask. In Allis and Koetsier’s
words, such philosophers believe that a set of position sentences is
not always to be admitted as a description of the state of the world
relevant to a certain action. In their opinion, a relevant
description of a state of the world should normally include a
different type of sentences (as is the case with Thomson’s lamp) or,
in any case, more than simply position sentences.
In section 1.2 I have pointed out and illustrated the fundamental
philosophical problem posed by supertasks. Obviously, one will only
consider it a problem if one deems the concepts employed in its
formulation acceptable. In fact, some philosophers reject them,
because they regard the very notion of supertask as problematic, as
leading to contradictions or at least to insurmountable conceptual
difficulties. Among these philosophers the first well-known one is
Zeno of Elea.
2.1: Zeno’s Dichotomy Paradox
Consider the dichotomy paradox in the formulation of it given in
section 1.3. According to Zeno, Achilles would never get to point B
(x = 1) because he would first have to reach the mid point of
his run (x = 1/2), after that he would have to get to the
mid point of the span which he has left (x = 1/2 +
1/4), and then to the mid point of the span which is left
(x = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8), and so on. Whatever the mid
point Achilles may reach in his journey, there will always exist
another one (the mid point of the stretch that is left for him to
cover) that he has not reached yet. In other words, Achilles will
never be able to reach point B and finish his run. According to Owen
(Owen [1957-58]), in this as well as in his other paradoxes, Zeno was
concerned to show that the Universe is a simple, global entity which
is not comprised of different parts. He tried to demonstrate that if
we take to making divisions and subdivisions we will obtain absurd
results (as in the dichotomy case) and that we must not yield to the
temptation of breaking up the world. Now the notion of supertask
entails precisely that, division into parts, as it involves breaking
up a time interval into successive intervals. Therefore, supertasks
are not feasible in the Zenonian world and, since they lead to absurd
results, the notion of supertask itself is conceptually objectionable.
In stark contrast to Zeno, the dichotomy paradox is standardly solved
by saying that the successive distances covered by Achilles as he
progressively reaches the mid points of the spans he has left to go
through --- 1/2, 1/4, 1/8, 1/16, . . . --- form an infinite
series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + . . . whose sum is 1.
Consequently, Achilles will indeed reach point B (x = 1) at t*
= 1 P.M. (which is to be expected if he travels with velocity v =
1 km/h, as has been assumed). Then there is no problem whatsoever in
splitting up his run into smaller sub-runs and, so, no inherent
problem about the notion of supertask. An objection can be made,
however, to this standard solution to the paradox: it tells us where
Achilles is at each instant but it does not explain where Zeno’s
argument breaks down. Importantly, there is another objection to the
standard solution, which hinges on the fact that, when it is claimed
that the infinite series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + . . .
adds up to 1, this is substantiated by the assertion that the sequence
of partial sums 1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2 + 1/4 +
1/8, . . . has limit 1, that is, that the difference between the
successive terms of the sequence and number 1 becomes progressively
smaller than any positive integer, no matter how small. But it might
be countered that this is just a patch up: the infinite series
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + . . . seems to involve infinite sums and
thus the performance of a supertask, and the proponent of the standard
solution is in fact presupposing that supertasks are feasible just in
order to justifiy that they are. To this the latter might reply that
the assertion that the sum of the series is 1 presupposes no infinite
sum, since, by definition, the sum of a series is the limit to which
its partial (and so finite) sums approach. His opponent can now
express his disagreement with the response that the one who supports
the standard solution is deducing a matter of fact (that Achilles is
at x = 1 at t* = 1 P.M.) from a definition pertaining to the
arithmetic of infinite series, and that it is blatantly unacceptable
to deduce empirical propositions from mere definitions.
2.2: The Inverse Form Of The Dichotomy Argument
Before concluding our discussion of the arguments connected with
Zeno’s dichotomy paradox which have been put forward against the
conceptual feasibility of supertasks, we should deal with the
so-called inverse dichotomy of Zeno, which can also be formulated as a
supertask, but whose status as a logical possibility seems to some
philosophers to be even more doubtful than that of the direct version
expounded in section 2.1. The process involved in the paradox of
inverse dichotomy admits of a supertask kind of description, as
follows. Suppose that at t = 12 A.M. Achilles is at point A (x
= 0) and wishes to do the action of reaching point B (x = 1).
In order to do this action he must first of all go from point A to the
mid point b1 (x = 1/2) of the span AB that he
wishes to cover. In order to do this, he must in turn first do the
action of going from point A to the mid point b2 (x
= 1/4) of the span Ab1 that he wishes to cover, and so
on . In order to reach B, Achilles will have to accomplish an
infinite sequence of actions, that is, a supertask T* = (. . . ,
an, . . . , a3, a2, a1),
provided we allow the state of the world relevant to the description
of T* to be specified, at a given arbitrary instant, by a single
sentence, the one specifying Achilles’s position at that instant.
Notice in the first place that T* has the same type of order as the
natural order of negative integers: . . . , -n, . . . , -3, -2, -1
(such order type is usually denoted with the expression ‘w*’
and the related supertasks can therefore be called supertasks of type
w*). The philosophical problem connected with supertasks of
type w, already discussed in section 1.2 above, does not arise
now because the set of sentences which describes the relevant state of
the world after the performance of supertask T* is obviously
a1(S), with S the set of sentences describing the initial
relevant state of the world. But as the successive states of the
world after S in relation to T* can be described by means of the
infinite sequence of sets of sentences . . . , an(S),
. . . , a3(S), a2(S), a1(S), some
philosophers think it puzzling and unacceptable that the initial set
of sentences in that sequence cannot be specified. This really means
that we cannot specify which is the action in supertask T* that should
be carried out first and that we consequently ignore how to begin.
Isn’t that proof enough that supertasks of type w* are
impossible? Chihara (1965), for example, says that Zeno’s inverse
dichotomy is even more problematic than the direct one, since Achilles
is supposed to be capable of doing something akin to counting the
natural numbers in reverse order. In his opinion, it is just as
impossible for Achilles to start his run -- if viewed as a supertask of
type w* -- as it is to start this reverse counting process.
2.3: On Thomson’s Impossibility Arguments
Thomson (1954-55) was convinced that he could show supertasks to be
logically impossible. To this end, he made up the lamp example
analysed in section 1.3, since known as ‘Thomson’s lamp’. Thomson
argued that the analysis of the workings of his lamp leads to
contradiction, and therefore the supertask involved is logically
impossible. But then, to the extent that this supertask is
representative of ‘genuine’ supertasks, all genuine supertasks are
impossible. Thomson’s argument is simple. Let us ask ourselves what
the state of the lamp is at t* = 1 P.M. At that instant the lamp
cannot be lit, the reason being the way we manipulate it: we never
light the lamp without dimming it some time later. Nor can the lamp
be dim, because even if it is dim initially, we light it and
subsequently never dim it without lighting it back again some time
later. Therefore,at t* = 1 P.M. the lamp can be neither dim nor lit.
However, one of its functioning conditions is that it must be either
dim or lit. Thus, a contradiction arises. Conclusion: Thomson’s lamp
or, better, the supertask consisting in its functioning is logically
impossible. Now is Thomson’s argument correct? Benacerraf (1962)
detected a serious flaw in it. Let us in principle distinguish
between the series of instants of time in which the actions
ai of the supertask are performed (which will be called the
t-series) and the instant t* = 1 P.M., the first instant after the
supertask has been accomplished. Thomson’s argument hinges on the way
we act on the lamp, but we only act on it at instants in the t-series,
and so what can be deduced logically from this way of acting will
apply only to instants in the t-series. As t* = 1 P.M. does not
belong to the t-series, it follows that Thomson’s supposed conclusion
that the lamp cannot be lit at t* is fallacious, and so is his
conclusion that it cannot be dim at t*. The conditions obtaining in
the lamp problem only enable us to conclude that the lamp will be
either dim or else lit but not both at t* = 1 P.M., and this follows
from the fact that this exclusive disjunction was presupposed from the
start to be true at each and every instant of time, independently of
the way in which we could act on the lamp in the t-series of instants
of time. What cannot be safely inferred is which one of these two
states -dim or lit- the lamp will be in at t* = 1 P.M. or,
alternatively, the state of the lamp at t* = 1 P.M. is not logically
determined by what has happened before that instant. This consequence
tallies with what was observed in section 2.1 about the fallacy
committed by adherents to the standard solution against Zeno: they
seek to deduce that at instant t* = 1 P.M. Achilles will be at point B
from an analysis of the sub-runs performed by him before that instant,
that is, they assume that Achilles’s state at t* follows logically
from his states at instants previous to t*, and in so assuming they
make the same mistake as Thomson.
Thomson (1954-55) put forward one more argument against the logical
possibility of his lamp. Let us assign to the lamp the value 0 when
it is dim and the value 1 when it is lit. Then lighting the lamp
means adding one unity (going from 0 to 1) and dimming it means
subtracting one unity (going from 1 to 0). It thus seems that the
final state of the lamp at t* = 1 P.M., after an infinite, and
alternating, sequence of lightings (additions of one unity) and
dimmings (subtractions of one unity), should be described by the
infinite series 1-1+1-1+1. . . If we accept the conventional
mathematical definition of the sum of a series, this series has no
sum, because the partial sums 1, 1-1, 1-1+1, 1-1+1-1, . . . ,
etc. take on the values 1 and 0 alternatively, without ever
approaching a definite limit that could be taken to be the proper sum
of the series. But in that case it seems that the final state of the
lamp can neither be dim (0) nor lit (1), which contradicts our
assumption that the lamp is at all times either dim or lit.
Benacerraf’s (1962) reply was that even though the first, second, third,
. . . , n-th partial sum of the series 1-1+1-1+1. . . does yield the
state of the lamp after one, two, three, . . . , n actions
ai (of lighting or dimming), it does not follow from this
that the final state of the lamp after the infinite sequence of
actions ai must of necessity be given by the sum of the
series, that is, by the limit to which its partial sums progressively
approach. The reason is that a property shared by the partial sums of
a series does not have to be shared by the limit to which those
partial sums tend. For instance, the partial sums of the series 0.3 +
0.03 + 0.003 + 0.0003 + . . . are 0.3, 0.3 + 0.03 = 0.33, 0.3 + 0.03 +
0.003 = 0.333,. . . , all of them, clearly, numbers less than 1/3;
however, the limit to which those partial sums tend (that is, the sum
of the original series) is 0.3333... , which is precisely the number
1/3.
2.4: On Black’s Impossibility Argument
Another one of the classical arguments against the logical
possibility of supertasks comes from Black (1950-51) and is
constructed around the functioning of an infinity machine of his own
invention. An infinity machine is a machine that can carry out an
infinite number of actions in a finite time. Black’s aim is to show
that an infinity machine is a logical impossibility. Consider the
case of one such machine whose sole task is to carry a ball from
point A (x = 0) to point B (x = 1) and viceversa.
Assume, in addition, that initially (at t = 12 A.M., say) the ball is
at A and that the machine carries out the following infinite sequence
of operations: when half the time until t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, it
does the action a1 of taking the ball from position A to
position B (a1 is thus carried out at t = 1/2 P.M.); when
half the time between the performance of a1 and t* = 1
P.M. has gone by, it does the action a2 of taking the ball
from position B to position A (a2 is thus carried out at t
= 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when half the time between the performance of
a2 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, the machine does the
action a3 of taking the ball from position A to position B
(a3 is thus performed in t = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so
on. When we get to instant t* = 1 P.M. the machine will have carried
out an infinite sequence of actions, that is, a supertask T =
(a1, a2, a3, . . . , an,
. . . ). The parallelism with Thomson’s lamp is clear when it is
realised that the ball in position A corresponds to the dim lamp and
the ball in position B corresponds to the lit lamp. Nevertheless,
Black believes that by assuming that at each instant the ball is
either in A or else in B (and note that assuming this means that the
machine transports the ball from A to B and viceversa
instantaneously, but we need not be worried by this, since all that
we are concerned with now is logical or conceptual possibility, not
physical possibility), he can deduce, by a totally different route
from Thomson’s based on the symmetrical functioning of his machine, a
contradiction regarding its state at t* = 1 P.M.. However,
Benacerraf’s criticisms also applies to Black’s argument. In effect,
the latter hinges on how the machine works, and as this has only been
specified for instants of time previous to t* = 1 P.M., it follows
that what can be logically inferred from the functioning of the
machine is only applicable to those instants previous to t* = 1 P.M..
Black seeks to deduce a contradiction at t* = 1 P.M. but he fails at
the same point as Thomson: whatever happens to the ball at t* = 1
P.M. cannot be a logical consequence of what has happened to it
before. Of course, one can always specify the functioning of the
machine for instants t greater than or equal to 1 P.M. by saying that
at all those instants the machine will not perform any actions at
all, but that is not going to help Black. His argument is fallacious
because he seeks to reach a logical conclusion regarding instant t* =
1 P.M. from information relative to times previous to that instant..
In the standard argument against Zeno’s dichotomy one could similarly
specify Achilles’s position at t* = 1 P.M. saying, for instance, that
he is at B (x = 1), but there is no way that this is going to
get us a valid argument out of a fallacious one, which seeks to
deduce logically where Achilles will be at t* = 1 P.M. from
information previous to that instant of time.
2.5: Benacerraf’s Critique and the Dichotomy Arguments
The cases dealt with above are examples of how Benacerraf’s strategy
can be used against supposed demonstrations of the logical
impossibility of supertasks. We have seen that the strategy is based
on the idea that
(I) the state of a system at an instant t* is not a logical
consequence of which states he has been in before t* (where by ‘state’
I mean ‘relevant state of the world’, see section 1.1)
and occasionally on the idea that
(II) the properties shared by the partial sums of a series do not
have to be shared by the limit to which those partial sums tend.
Since the partial sums of a series make up a succession (of partial
sums), (II) may be rewritten as follows:
(III) the properties shared by the terms of a
succession do not have to be shared by the limit to which that
succession tends.
If we keep (I), (II) and (III) well in mind, it is easy not to yield
to the perplexing implications of certain supertasks dealt with in the
literature. And if we do not yield to the perplexing results, we will
also not fall into the trap of considering supertasks conceptually
impossible. (III), for instance, may be used to show that it is not
impossible for Achilles to perform the supertasks of the inverse and
the direct dichotomy of Zeno. Take the case of the direct dichotomy:
the limit of the corresponding succession of instants of time
t1, t2, t3, . . . at which each one
of Achilles’s successive sub-runs is finished can be the instant at
which Achilles’s supertask has been accomplished, even if such a
supertask is not achieved at any one of the instants in the infinite
succession t1, t2, t3, . . . (all of
this in perfect agreement with (III)).
2.6: Conclusion
As a corollary it may be said that supertasks do not seem to be
intrinsically impossible. The contradictions that they supposedly
give rise to may be avoided if one rejects certain unwarranted
assumptions that are usually made. The main such assumption,
responsible for the apparent conceptual impossibility of supertasks,
is that properties which are preserved after a finite number of
actions or operations will likewise be preserved after an infinite
number of them. But that is not true in general. For example, we saw
in section 1.2 above that the relevant state of the world after the
performance of a task T = (a1, a2, . . . ,
an) on the relevant state S was logically determined by T
and by S (and was an(an-1(an-2(. . .
(a2(a1(S))). . . )))),
but we have now learned that after the performance of a supertask T =
(a1, a2, a3, . . . , an,
. . . ) it is not (that is the core of Benacerraf’s critique). The
same sort of uncritical assumptions seem to be in the origin of
infinity paradoxes in general, in which certain properties are
extrapolated from the finite to the infinite that are only valid for
the finite, as when it is assumed that there must be more numbers
greater than zero than numbers greater than 1000 because all numbers
greater than 1000 are also greater than zero but not viceversa
(Galileo’s paradox). In conclusion, if some supertasks are
paradoxical, it is not because of any inherent inconsistency of the
notion of supertask. This opinion is adhered to by authors such as
Earman and Norton (1996).
We have gone through several arguments for the conceptual
impossibility of supertasks and counterarguments to these. Those who
hold that supertasks are conceptually possible may however not agree
as to whether they are also physically possible. In general, when
this issue is discussed in the literature, by physical possibility is
meant possibility in relation with certain broad physical principles,
laws or ‘circumstances’ which seems to operate in the real world, at
least as far as we know. But it is a well-known fact that authors do
not always agree about which those principles, laws or circumstances
are.
3.1: Kinematical Impossibility
In our model of Thomson’s lamp we are assuming that at each moment the
switch can be in just one of two set positions (‘off’, ‘on’). If
there is a fixed distance d between them, then clearly, since the
switch swings an infinite number of times from the one to the other
from t = 12 A.M. until t* = 1 P.M., it will have covered an infinite
distance in one hour. For this to happen it is thus necessary for the
speed with which the switch moves to increase unboundedly during this
time span. Grünbaum has taken this requirement to be physically
impossible to fulfil. Grünbaum (1970) believes that there is a sort
of physical impossibility of a purely kinematical nature (kinematical
impossibility) and describes it in more precise terms by saying that a
supertask is kinematically impossible if:
a) At least one of the moving bodies travels at an unboundedly
increasing speed,
b) For some instant of time t*, the position of at least one of the
moving bodies does not approach any defined limit as we get
arbitrarily closer in time to t*.
It is clear then that the Thomson’s lamp supertask, in the version
presented so far, is kinematically (and eo ipso physically)
impossible, since not only does the moving switch have to travel at a
speed that increases unboundedly but also -because it oscillates
between two set positions which are a constant distance d apart- its
position does not approach any definite limit as we get closer to
instant t* = 1 P.M., at which the supertask is accomplished.
Nevertheless, Grünbaum has also shown models of Thomson’s lamp
which are kinematically possible. Take a look at Figure 1, in which
the switch (in position ‘on’ there) is simply a segment AB of the
circuit connecting generator G with lamp L. The circuit segment AB
can shift any distance upwards so as to open the circuit in order for
L to be dimmed. Imagine we push the switch successively upwards and
downwards in the way illustrated in Figure 2, so that it always has
the same velocity v = 1.
Figure 1
Figure 2
The procedure is the following. Initially (t = 0) the switch is in
position
A
B (lamp dim) a
height of 0.2 above the circuit and moving downwards (at v =
1). At t = 0.2 it will be in position AB (lamp lit) and will begin
moving upwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.01 it will be in
position
A
B
(lamp dim) and will begin moving downwards (v = 1). At t =
0.2 + 0.01 + 0.01 = 0.2 + 0.02 it will be in position AB (lamp lit)
and will begin moving upwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.02 +
0.001 it will be in position
AB
(lamp dim), and so on. Obviously, between t = 0 and t* = 0.2 + 0.02
+ 0.002 + . . . = 0.2222... = 2/9, the lamp is in the states ‘dim’
and ‘lit’ an infinite number of times, and so a supertask is
accomplished. But this supertask is not kinematically impossible,
because it has been so designed that the switch always moves with
velocity v = 1 -- and, therefore, condition (a) for
kinematical impossibility is not fulfilled -- and that, additionally,
as we get closer to the limit time t* = 2/9 (the only one which could
cause us any trouble) the switch approaches more and more a
well-defined limit position, position AB (lamp lit) -and, therefore,
condition b) for kinematical impossibility is not fulfilled either.
Once the kinematical possibility has been established, what is the
state of the lamp at t* = 2/9? What has been said so far does not
enable us to give a determinate answer to this question (just as the
obvious kinematical possibility of Achilles’s supertask in the
dichotomy paradox does not suffice to determine where Achilles will
be at t* = 1 P.M.), but there exists a ‘natural’ result. It seems
intuitively acceptable that the position the switch will occupy at t*
= 2/9 will be position AB, and so the lamp will be lit at that
instant. There is no mysterious asymmetry about this result. Figure
3 shows a model of Thomson’s lamp with a switch that works according
to exactly the same principles as before, but which will yield the
‘natural’ result that the lamp will in the end be dim at t* = 2/9.
In effect, the switch will now finally end up in the ‘natural’
position AB at t* = 2/9 and will thereby bring about an electrical
short-circuit that will make all the current in the generator pass
through the cable on which the switch is set, leaving nothing for the
more resistant path where the lamp is.
Figure 3
There are some who believe that the very fact that there exist
Thomson’s lamps yielding an intuitive result of ‘lamp lit’ when the
supertask is accomplished but also other lamps whose intuitive result
is ‘lamp dim’ brings up back to the contradiction which Thomson
thought to have found originally. But we have nothing of that sort.
What we do have is different physical models with different
end-results. This does not contradict but rather corroborates the
results obtained by Benacerraf: the final state is not logically
determined by the previous sequence of states and operations. This
logical indeterminacy can indeed become physical determinacy, at least
sometimes, depending on what model of Thomson’s lamp is employed.
A conspicuous instance of a supertask which is kinematically
impossible is the one performed by Black’s infinity machine, whose
task it is to transport a ball from position A (x = 0) to
position B (x = 1) and from B to A an infinite number of times
in one hour. As with the switch in our first model of Thomson’s lamp,
it is obvious that the speed of the ball increases unboundedly (and so
condition a) for impossibility is met), while at the same time, as we
approach t* = 1 P.M., its position does not tend to any defined limit,
due to the fact that it must oscillate continuously between two set
positions A and B one unity distance apart from each other (and so
also condition b) for impossibility is met).
3.2: The Principle Of Continuity and the Solution to the Philosophical Problem of Supertasks
Up to this point we have seen examples of supertasks which are
conceptually possible and, among these, we have discovered some which
are also physically possible. For the latter to happen we had to make
sure that at least some requirements were complied with which,
plausibly, characterise the processes that can actually take place in
our world. But some definitive statement remains to be made about the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks: what the state of the world
is after they have been accomplished. The principles of physical
nature which have so far been appealed to do not enable us to
pronounce on this matter. The question thus arises whether some new
principle of a physical nature can be discovered which holds in the
real world and is instrumental in answering the question what the
state of the world will be after a supertask. That discovery would
allow us to resolve a radical indeterminacy which still persists -the
reader will remember that even in the case of Achilles’s dichotomy
supertask we were quite unable to prove that it would conclude with
Achilles in point B (x = 1). In Section 2.1 we saw that such proof
cannot be obtained by recourse to the mathematical theory of infinite
series exclusively; why should it be assumed that this abstract theory
is literally applicable to the physical universe? After all, amounts
of money are added up applying ordinary arithmetic but, as Black
reminded us, velocities cannot be added up according to ordinary
arithmetic.
Since Benacerraf’s critique, we know that there is no logical
connection between the position of Achilles at t* = 1 P.M. and his
positions at instants previous to t* = 1 P.M. Sainsbury [1988] has
tried to bridge the gap opened by Benacerraf. He claims that this can
be achieved by drawing a distinction between abstract space of a
mathematical kind and physical space. No distinction between
mathematical and physical space has to be made, however, to attain
that goal; one need only appeal to a single principle of physical
nature, which is, moreover, simple and general, namely, that the
trajectories of material bodies are continuous lines. To put it more
graphically, what this means is that we can draw those trajectories
without lifting our pen off the paper. More precisely, that the
trajectory of a material body is a continuous line means that,
whatever the instant t, the limit to which the position occupied by
the body tends as time approaches t coincides precisely with the
position of the body at t. Moreover, the principle of continuity is
highly plausible as a physical hypothesis: the trajectories of all
physical bodies in the real world are in fact continuous. What
matters is that we realise that, aided by this principle, we can now
finally demonstrate that after the accomplishment of the dichotomy
supertask, that is, at t* = 1 P.M., Achilles will be in point B
(x = 1). We know, in fact, that as the time Achilles has spent
running gets closer and closer to t* = 1 P.M., his position will
approach point x = 1 more and more, or, equivalently, we know
that the limit to which the position occupied by Achilles tends as
time get progressively closer to t* = 1 P.M. is point B (x =
1). As Achilles’s trajectory must be continuous, by the definition of
continuity (applied to instant t = t* = 1 P.M.) we obtain that the
limit to which the position occupied by Achilles tends as time
approaches t* = 1 P.M. coincides with Achilles’s position at t* = 1
P.M. Since we also know that this limit is point B (x = 1), it
finally follows that Achilles’s position at t* = 1 P.M. is point B
(x = 1). Now is when we can spot the flaw in the standard
argument against Zeno mentioned in section 2.1, which was grounded on
the observation that the sequence of distances covered by Achilles
(1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8, . . . ) has
1 as its limit. This alone does not suffice to conclude that Achilles
will reach point x = 1, unless it is assumed that if the
distances run by Achilles have 1 as their limit, then Achilles will as
a matter of fact reach x = 1, but assuming this entails using
the principle of continuity. This principle affords us a rigorous
demonstration of what, in any event, was already plausible and
intuitively ‘natural’: that after having performed the infinite
sequence of actions (a1, a2, a3,
. . . , an, . . . ) Achilles will have reached point B
(x = 1). In addition, now it is easy to show how, with a
switch like the one in Figure 2, Thomson’s lamp in Figure 1 will reach
t* = 2/9 with its switch in position AB and will therefore be lit. We
have in fact already pointed out (3.1) that in this case, as we get
closer to the limit time t* = 2/9, the switch indefinitely approaches
a well-defined limit position -position AB. Due to the fact that the
principle of continuity applies to the switch, because it is a
physical body, this well-defined limit position must coincide
precisely with the position of the switch at t* = 2/9. Therefore, at
t* = 2/9 the latter will be in positon AB and, consequently, the lamp
will be lit. By the same token, it can also be shown that the lamp in
Figure 3 will be dim at time t* = 2/9.
3.3: The Postulate of Permanence
In Section 3.2, the principle of continuity helped us find the final
state resulting from the accomplishment of a supertask in cases in
which there exists a ‘natural’ limit for the state of the physical
system involved as time progressively approaches the instant at which
the supertask is achieved. Now it is considerably more problematic to
apply this principle to supertasks for which there is no ‘natural’
limit. For an example, let us consider Black’s infinity machine,
introduced in Section 2.4, and let us ask ourselves where the ball
will be at instant t* = 1 P.M. at which the supertask is achieved. We
can set up a reductio ad absurdum type of argument, as follows.
Assume that at t* = 1 P.M. the ball were to occupy position P, that it
was in point P. According to the principle of continuity, it follows
that the limit to which the position occupied by the ball tends as
time approaches t* = 1 P.M. is precisely position P. We know, though,
that Black’s infinity machine makes the ball oscillate more and more
quickly between the fixed points A (x = 0) and B (x = 1)
as we get closer to t* = 1 P.M., so the position of the ball does not
approach any definite limit as we get closer to t* = 1 P.M. This
conclusion patently contradicts what follows from the principle of
continuity. Therefore, the assumption that, after Black’s supertask
is achieved (t* = 1 P.M.), the ball is at point P leads to
contradiction with the principle of continuity. Thus, the ball cannot
be at point P at t* = 1 P.M., and as the point can be any, given that
it has been chosen arbitrarily, the ball cannot be at any single one
of the points, which means that at t* = 1 P.M. the ball has ceased to
exist. This funny conclusion is consistent with the principle of
continuity, as we have just seen, but it enters into contradiction
with what could be termed the ‘postulate of permanence’: no material
body (and by that we mean a given quantity of matter) can go out of
existence all of a sudden, without leaving any traces. The postulate
of permanence seems to characterise our world at least as evidently as
the principle of continuity. Notice in particular that certain
physical bodies (particles) may dematerialise, but that is not
inconsistent with the postulate of permanence since such a
dematerialisation leaves an energy trace (which is not true of Black’s
ball). Consequently, we can see that the case Black’s infinity
machine is one in which the principles of continuity and permanence
turn out to be mutually inconsistent. As long as we do not give up
any of them, we are forced to accept that such an infinity machine is
physically impossible.
As we do not know exactly what laws of nature there are, it goes
without saying that the question whether a particular supertask is
physically possible (that is, compatible with those laws) cannot be
given a definitive answer in general. What we have done in 3 above is
rather to set out necessary conditions for physical possibility which
are plausible (such as the principle of continuity) and sufficient
conditions for physical impossibility which are likewise plausible
(such as Grünbaum’s criterion of kinematical impossibility). In
this section we shall look into a problem related to the one just
dealt with, but one to which a definitive answer can be given: the
problem of deciding whether a certain supertask is possible within the
framework of a given physical theory, that is, whether it is
compatible with the principles of that theory. These are two distinct
problems. At this stage our object are theories whereas in 3 above we
were concerned with the real world. What we are after is supertasks
formulated within the defined framework of a given physical theory
which can tell us something exciting and/or new about that theory. We
will discover that this search will lead us right into the heart of
basic theoretical problems.
4.1: A New Form of Indeterminism: Spontaneous Self-Excitation
Classical dynamics is a theory that studies the motion of physical
bodies which interact among themselves in various ways. The vast
majority of interesting examples of supertasks within this theory have
been elaborated under the assumption that the particles involved only
interact with one another by means of elastic collisions, that is,
collisions in which no energy is dissipated. We shall see here that
supertasks of type w* give rise to a new form of
indeterministic behaviour of dynamical systems. The most simple type
of case (Pérez Laraudogoitia [1996]) is illustrated by the
particle system represented in Figure 4 at three distinct moments. It
consists of an infinite set of identical point particles
P1, P2, P3, . . . , Pn,
. . . arranged in a straight line. Take the situation depicted in
Figure 4A first. In it P1 is at one unity distance from
the coordinate origin O, P2 at a distance 1/2 of O,
P3 at a distance 1/3 of O and so on. In addition, let it
be that all the particles are at rest, except for P1, which
is approaching O with velocity v = 1. Suppose that all this
takes place at t = 0. Now we will employ
Figure 4
the well-known dynamic theorem by which if two identical particles
undergo an elastic collision then they will exchange their velocities
after colliding. If our particles P1, P2,
P3, . . . collide elastically, it is easy to predict what
will happen after t = 0 with the help of this theorem. In the event
that P1 were on its own, it would reach O at t = 1, but in
fact it will collide with P2 and lie at rest there, while
P2 will acquire velocity v = 1. If P1
and P2 were on their own, then it would be P2
that would reach O at t = 1, but P2 will in fact collide
with P3, and lie at rest there, while P3 will
acquire velocity v = 1. Again, it can be said that if
P1, P2 and P3 were on their own, then
it is P3 that would reach O at t = 1, but in actual fact it
will collide with P4 and lie at rest there, while
P4 will acquire velocity v = 1, and so on. From the
foregoing it follows that no particle will get to O at t = 1, because
it will be impeded by a collision with another particle. Therefore,
at t = 1 all the particles will already lie at rest, which yields the
configuration in Figure 4B. Since P1 stopped when it
collided with P2, it will occupy the position P2
had initially (at t = 0). Similarly, P2 stopped after
colliding with P3 and so it will occupy the position
P3 had initially (at t = 0), . . . , etc. If we view each
collision as an action (which is plausible, since it involves a sudden
change of velocities), it turns out that between t = 0 and t = 1 our
evolving particle system has performed a supertask of type w.
The second dynamic theorem we will make use of says that if a dynamic
process is possible, then the process resulting from inverting the
direction in which all the bodies involved in it move is also
possible. Applying this to our case, if the process leading from the
system in the situation depicted in Figure 4A to the situation
depicted in Figure 4B is possible (and we have just seen it is), then
the process obtained by simply inverting the direction in which the
particles involved move will also be possible. This new possible
process does not bring the system from configuration 4B back to
configuration 4A but rather changes it into configuration 4C (as the
direction in which P1 moves must be inverted). As the
direct process lasts one time unity (from t = 0 to t = 1), so will the
inverse process, and as in the direct process the system performs a
supertask of type w, in the inverse process it will perform one
of type w*. What is interesting about this new supertask of
type w*? What’s interesting is that it takes the system from a
situation (4B) in which all its component particles are at rest to
another situation (4C) in which not all of them are. This means that
the system has self-excited, because no external influence has been
exerted on it, and, what is more, it has done so spontaneously and
unpredictably, because the supertask can set off at any instant and
there is no way of predicting when it will happen. We have found a
supertask of type w* to be the source of a new form of
dynamical indeterminism. The reason we speak of indeterminism is
because there is no initial movement to the performance of the
supertask. The system self-excites in such a way that each particle is
set off by a collision with another one, and it is the ordinal type
w* of the sequence of collisions accomplished in a finite time
that guarantees movement, without the need for a ‘prime mover’. Now
movement without a ‘prime mover’ is precisely what characterises the
dynamical indeterminism linked to supertasks of type w*.
4.2: Bifurcated Supertasks
Within relativity theory, supertasks have been approached from a
radically different perspective from the one adopted here so
far. This new perspective is inherently interesting, since it links
the problem of supertasks up with the relativistic analysis of the
structure of space-time. To get an insight into the nature of that
connection, let us first notice that, according to the theory of
relativity, the duration of a process will not be the same in
different reference systems but will rather vary according to the
reference system within which it is measured. This leaves open the
possibility that a process which lasts an infinite amount of time
when measured within reference system O may last a finite time when
measured within a different reference system O’.
The supertask literature has needed to exploit space-times with
sufficiently complicated structure that global reference systems
cannot be defined in them. In these and other cases, the time of a
process can be represented by its ‘proper time’. If we represent a
process by its world-line in space-time, the proper time of the
process is the time read by a good clock that moves with the process
along its world-line. A familiar example of its use is the problem
of the twins in special relativity. One twin stays home on earth and
grows old. Forty years of proper time, for example, elapses along
his world-line. The travelling twin accelerates off into space and
returns to find his sibling forty years older. But much less time --
say only a year of proper time -- will have elapsed along the
travelling twin world-line if he has accelerated to sufficiently
great speeds.
If we take this into account it is easily seen that the definition
of supertask that we have been using is ambiguous. In section 1
above we defined a supertask as an infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. But we have not
specified in whose proper time we measure the finite interval of
time. Do we take the proper time of the process under consideration?
Or do we take the proper time of some observer who watches the
process? It turns out that relativity theory allows the former to be
infinite while the latter is finite. This fact opens new
possibilities for supertasks. Relativity theory thus forces us to
disambiguate our definition of supertask, and there is actually one
natural way to do it. We can use Black’s idea -- presented in 2.4 --
of an infinity machine, a device capable of performing a supertask,
to redefine a supertask as an infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out by an infinity machine in a finite interval of
the machine’s own proper time measured within the reference system
associated to the machine. This redefinition of the notion of
supertask does not change anything that has been said until now; our
whole discussion remains unaffected so long as ‘finite interval of
time’ is read as ‘finite interval of the machine’s proper time’.
This notion of supertask, disambiguated so as to accord with
relativity theory, will be denoted by the expression ‘supertask-1’.
Thus:
Supertask-1: an infinite sequence of actions or operations carried
out by an infinity machine in a finite interval of the machine’s
proper time.
However we might also imagine a machine that carries out an infinite
sequence of actions or operations in an infinite machine proper time,
but that the entire process can be seen by an observer in a finite
amount of the observer’s proper time.
It is convenient at this stage to introduce a contrasting notion:
Supertask-2: an infinite sequence of actions or operations carried
out by a machine in a finite interval of an observer’s proper time.
While we did not take relativity theory into account, the notions of
supertask-1 and supertask-2 coincided. The duration of an interval of
time between two given events is the same for all observers. However
in relativistic spacetimes this is no longer so and the two notions
of supertasks become distinct. Even though all supertasks-1 are also
supertasks-2, there may in principle be supertasks-2 which are not
supertasks-1. For instance, it could just so happen that there is a
machine (not necessarily an infinity machine) which carries out an
infinite number of actions in an interval of its own proper time of
infinite duration, but in an interval of some observer’s proper time
of finite duration. Such a machine would have performed a supertask-2
but not a supertask-1.
The distinction between supertasks-1 and supertasks-2 is certainly
no relativistic hair-splitting. Why? Because those who hold that,
while conceptually possible, supertasks are physically impossible
(this seems to be the position adopted by Benacerraf and Putnam [1964],
for instance) usually mean that supertasks-1 are physically
impossible. But from this, it does not follow that supertasks-2 must
also be physically impossible. Relativity theory thus adds a
brand-new, exciting extra dimension to the challenge presented by
supertasks. Earman and Norton (1996), who have studied this issue
carefully, use the name ‘bifurcated supertasks’ to refer specifically
to supertasks-2 which are not supertasks-1, and I will adopt this
term.
4.3: Bifurcated Supertasks and the Solution to the Philosophical Problem of Supertasks
What shape does the philosophical problem posed by supertasks --
introduced in Section 1.2 -- take on now? Remember that the problem
lay in specifying the set of sentences which describe the state of
the world after the supertask has been performed. The problem will
now be to specify the set of sentences which describe the relevant
state of the world after the bifurcated supertask has been performed.
Before this can done, of course, the question needs to be answered
whether a bifurcated supertask is physically possible. Given that we
agree that compatibility with relativity theory is a necessary and
sufficient condition of physical possibility, we can reply in the
affirmative.
Pitowsky (1990) first showed how this compatibility might arise. He
considered a Minkowski spacetime, the spacetime of special
relativity. He showed that an observer O* who can maintain a
sufficient increase in his acceleration will find that only a finite
amount of proper time elapses along his world-line in the course of
the complete history of the universe, while other unaccelerated
observers would find an infinite proper time elapsing on theirs.
Let us suppose that some machine M accomplishes a bifurcated
supertask in such a way that the infinite sequence of actions
involved happens in a finite interval of an observer O’s proper time.
If we imagine such an observer at some event on his world-line, all
those events from which he can retrieve information are in the ‘past
light cone’ of the observer. That is, the observer can receive
signals travelling at or less than the speed of light from any event
in his past light cone. The philosophical problem posed by the
bifurcated supertask accomplished by M has a particularly simple
solution when the infinite sequence of actions carried out by M is
fully contained within the past light cone of an event on observer
O’s world-line. In such a case the relevant state of the world after
the bifurcated supertask has been performed is M’s state, and this,
in principle, can be specified, since O has causal access to it.
Unfortunately, a situation of this type does not arise in the simple
bifurcated supertask devised by Pitowsky (1990). In his supertask,
while the accelerated observer O* will have a finite upper bound on
the proper time elapsed on his world-line, there will be no event on
his world-line from which he can look back and see an infinity of
time elapsed along the world-line of some unaccelerated observer.
To find a spacetime in which the philosophical problem posed by
bifurcated supertasks admits of the simple solution that has just
been mentioned, we will move from the flat spacetime of special
relativity to the curved spacetimes of general relativity. One type
of spacetime in the latter class that admits of this simple solution
has been dubbed Malament-Hogarth spacetime, from the names of the
first scholars to use them (Hogarth [1992]). An example of such a
spacetime is an electrically charged black hole (the
Reissner-Nordstroem spacetime). A well known property of black holes
is that, in the view of those who remain outside, unfortunates who
fall in appear to freeze in time as they approach the event horizon
of the black hole. Indeed those who remain outside could spend an
infinite lifetime with the unfortunate who fell in frozen near the
event horizon. If we just redescribe this process from the point of
view of the observer who does fall in to the black hole, we discover
that we have a bifurcated supertask. The observer falling in
perceives no slowing down of time in his own processes. He sees
himself reaching the event horizon quite quickly. But if he looks
back at those who remain behind, he sees their processes sped up
indefinitely. By the time he reaches the event horizon, those who
remain outside will have completed infinite proper time on their
world-lines. Of course, the cost is high. The observer who flings
himself into a black hole will be torn apart by tidal forces and
whatever remains after this would be unable to return to the world in
which he started.
5.1: A Critique of Intuitionism
The possibility of supertasks has interesting consequences for the
philosophy of mathematics. To start with, take a well-known unsolved
mathematical problem, for example that of knowing whether Goldbach’s
conjecture is or is not correct. Goldbach’s conjecture asserts that
any even number greater than 2 is the sum of two prime numbers.
Nobody has been capable of showing whether this is true yet, but if
supertasks are possible, that question can be resolved. Let us, to
that effect, perform the supertask of type w consisting in the
following sequence of actions: action a1 involves checking
whether the first pair greater than 2 (number 4) is the sum of two
prime numbers or not; let this action be accomplished at t = 0.3 P.M.;
action a2 involves checking whether the second pair greater
than 2 (number 6) is the sum of two prime numbers or not; let this
action be accomplished at t = 0.33 P.M.; action a3 involves
checking whether the third pair greater than 2 (number 8) is the sum
of two prime numbers or not; let this action be accomplished at t =
0.333 P.M., and so on. It is clear that at t = 0.33333... = 1/3 P.M.,
the instant at which the supertask has already been performed, we will
have checked all the pairs greater than 2, and, therefore, will have
found some which is not the sum of two prime numbers or else will have
found all of them to be the sum of two prime numbers. In the first
case, we will know at t = 1/3 P.M. that Goldbach’s conjecture is
false; in the seocnd case we will know at t = 1/3 P.M. that it is
true. Weyl (1949) seems to have been the first to point to this
intriguing method -the use of supertaks- for settling mathematical
questions about natural numbers. He, however, rejected it on the
basis of his finitist conception of mathematics; since the performance
of a supertask involves the successive carrying out of an actual
infinity of actions or operations, and the infinity is impossible to
accomplish, in his view. For Weyl, taking the infinite as an actual
entity makes no sense. Nevertheless, there are more problems here
than Weyl imagines, at least for those who ground their finitist
philosophy of mathematics on intuitionism à la Brouwer. That
is because Brouwer’s rejection of actual infinity stems from the fact
that we, as beings, are immersed in time. But this in itself does not
mean that all infinities are impossible to accomplish, since an
infinity machine is also ‘a being immerse in time’ and that in itself
does not prevent the carrying out of the infinity of successive
actions a supertask is comprised of. It goes without saying that one
can adhere to a constructivist philosophy of mathematics (and the
consequent rejection of actual infinity) for diferent reasons from
Brouwer’s; supertasks will still not be the right kind of objet to
study either.
As Benacerraf and Putnam (1964) have observed, the acknowledgement
that supertasks are possible has a profound influence on the
philosophy of mathematics: the notion of truth (in arithmetic, say)
would no longer be doubtful, in the sense of dependent on the
particular axiomatisation used. The example mentioned earlier in
connection with Goldbach’s conjecture can indeed be reproduced and
generalised to all other mathematical statements involving numbers
(although, depending on the complexity of the statement, we might need
to use several infinity machines instead of just one), and so,
consequently, supertasks will enable us to decide on the truth or
falsity of any arithmetical statement; our conclusion will no longer
depend on provability in some formal system or constructibility in a
more or less strict intuitionistic sense. This conclusion seems to
lead to a Platonist philosophy of mathematics.
5.2: The Importance of the Malament-Hogarth Spacetime
A similar conclusion follows regarding the implications of
supertasks for the philosophy of mathematics if one only accepts the
possibility of bifurcated supertasks. Of course, a bifurcated
supertask performed in a non-Malament-Hogarth space-time would not be
so interesting in this sense. The obvious reason is that we would
not even have a sound procedure to determine the truth or falsity of
Goldbach’s conjecture seen in 5.1 by means of the performance of an
infinite sequence of actions of order type w. To really have a safe
decision procedure in this simple case (as in other, more complex
ones) there must necessarily exist an instant of time at which it can
be said that the supertask has been accomplished. Otherwise, in the
event that the machine finds a counterexample to Goldbach’s
conjecture we will know it to be false, but in the event of the
machine finding none we will not be able to tell that it is true,
because for this there must exist an instant of time by which the
supertask has been accomplished and at which we can say something
like: "the supertask has been performed and the machine has found no
counterexamples to Goldbach’s conjecture; therefore, the conjecture
is true". It follows that, in the case of a bifurcated supertask,
possessing a sound decision procedure on Goldbach’s conjecture
requires the existence of an observer O such that the infinite
sequence of actions (of order type w) carried out by the machine lies
within the past light cone of an event on observer O’s world-line.
But this is equivalent to saying that the relativistic space-time in
which the bifurcated supertask is performed is a Malament-Hogarth
space-time, and this realisation is one of the main reasons why this
sort of relativistic space-times have been studied in the literature.
Note, finally, the intuitionistic criticism of the possibility of
supertasks is even less effective in the case of bifurcated
supertasks, because in this latter case it is not required that there
is any sort of device capable of carrying out an infinite number of
actions or operations in a finite time (measured in the reference
system associated to the device in question, which is the natural
reference system to consider). In contrast, from the possibility of
bifurcated supertasks in Malament-Hogarth space-times strong
arguments follow against an intuitionistic philosophy of mathematics.
As Earman and Norton remind us, it is noteworthy that certain facts
relative to the non-Euclidean structure of space-time can have
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[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
infinity |
space and time: Malament-Hogarth spacetimes and the new computability |
Zeno’s paradoxes
Copyright © 1999, 2000 by
Jon Pérez Laraudogoitia
The University of the Basque Country
ylppelaj@vc.ehu.es
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First published: June 29, 1999
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