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Evolutionary Epistemology
Evolutionary Epistemology is a naturalistic approach to epistemology,
which emphasizes the importance of natural selection in two primary
roles. In the first role, selection is the generator and maintainer
of the reliability of our senses and cognitive mechanisms, as well as
the "fit" between those mechanisms and the world. In the second role,
trial and error learning and the evolution of scientific theories are
construed as selection processes.
Traditional epistemology has its roots in Plato and the ancient
skeptics. One strand emerges from Plato’s interest in the
problem of distinguishing between knowledge and true belief. His
solution was to suggest that knowledge differs from true belief in
being justified. Ancient skeptics complained that all attempts to
provide any such justification were hopelessly flawed. Another
strand emerges from the attempt to provide a reconstruction of human
knowledge showing how the pieces of human knowledge fit together in a
structure of mutual support. This project got its modern stamp from
Descartes and comes in empiricist as well as rationalist versions
which in turn can be given either a foundational or coherentist
twist. The two strands are woven together by a common theme. The
bonds that hold the reconstruction of human knowledge together are
the justificational and evidential relations which enable us to
distinguish knowledge from true belief.
The traditional approach is predicated on the assumption that
epistemological questions have to be answered in ways which do not
presuppose any particular knowledge. The argument is that any such
appeal would obviously be question begging. Such approaches may be
appropriately labeled "transcendental."
The Darwinian revolution of the nineteenth century suggested an
alternative approach first explored by Dewey and the
pragmatists. Human beings, as the products of evolutionary
development, are natural beings. Their capacities for knowledge and
belief are also the products of a natural evolutionary
development. As such, there is some reason to suspect that knowing,
as a natural activity, could and should be treated and analyzed along
lines compatible with its status, i. e., by the methods of natural
science. On this view, there is no sharp division of labor between
science and epistemology. In particular, the results of particular
sciences such as evolutionary biology and psychology are not ruled
a priori irrelevant to the solution of epistemological
problems. Such approaches, in general, are called naturalistic
epistemologies, whether they are directly motivated by evolutionary
considerations or not. Those which are directly motivated by
evolutionary considerations and which argue that the growth of
knowledge follows the pattern of evolution in biology are called
"evolutionary epistemologies."
Evolutionary epistemology is the attempt to address questions in the
theory of knowledge from an evolutionary point of view. Evolutionary
epistemology involves, in part, deploying models and metaphors drawn
from evolutionary biology in the attempt to characterize and resolve
issues arising in epistemology and conceptual change. As disciplines
co-evolve, models are traded back and forth. Thus, evolutionary
epistemology also involves attempts to understand how biological
evolution proceeds by interpreting it through models drawn from our
understanding of conceptual change and the development of
theories. The term "evolutionary epistemology" was coined by Donald
Campbell (1974).
There are two interrelated but distinct programs which go by the name
"evolutionary epistemology." One focuses on the development of
cognitive mechanisms in animals and humans. This involves a
straightforward extension of the biological theory of evolution to
those aspects or traits of animals which are the biological
substrates of cognitive activity, e. g., their brains, sensory
systems, motor systems, etc. The other program attempts to account
for the evolution of ideas, scientific theories, epistemic norms and
culture in general by using models and metaphors drawn from
evolutionary biology. Both programs have their roots in 19th century
biology and social philosophy, in the work of Darwin, Spencer, James
and others. There have been a number of attempts in the intervening
years to develop the programs in detail (see Campbell 1974, Bradie
1986, Cziko 1995). Much of the contemporary work in evolutionary
epistemology derives from the work of Konrad Lorenz (1977), Donald
Campbell (1974, et. al.), Karl Popper (1972, 1984) and Stephen
Toulmin (1967, 1972).
The two programs have been labeled EEM and EET. (Bradie, 1986) EEM is
the label for the program which attempts to provide an evolutionary
account of the development of cognitive structures. EET is the label
for the program which attempts to analyze the development of human
knowledge and epistemological norms by appealing to relevant
biological considerations. Some of these attempts involve analyzing
the growth of human knowledge in terms of selectionist models and
metaphors (e. g., Popper 1972, Toulmin 1972, Hull 1988). Others argue
for a biological grounding of epistemological norms and methodologies
but eschew selectionist models of the growth of human
knowledge as such (e. g., Ruse 1986, Rescher 1990).
The EEM and EET programs are interconnected but distinct. A
successful EEM selectionist explanation of the development of cognitive
brain structures provides no warrant, in itself, for extrapolating
such models to understand the development of human knowledge
systems. Similarly, endorsing an EET selectionist account of how human
knowledge systems grow does not, in itself, warrant concluding that
specific or general brain structures involved in cognition are the
result of natural selection for enhanced cognitive capacities. The
two programs, though similar in design and drawing upon the same
models and metaphors, do not stand or fall together.
Biological development involves both ontogenetic and phylogenetic
considerations. Thus, the development of specific traits, such as the
opposable thumb in humans, can be viewed both from the point of view
of the development of that trait in individual organisms (ontogeny)
and the development of that trait in the human lineage
(phylogeny). The development of knowledge and knowing mechanisms
exhibits a parallel distinction. We can consider the growth of an
individual’s corpus of knowledge and epistemological norms or
his or her brain (ontogeny) or the growth of human knowledge and
establishment of epistemological norms across generations or the
development of brains in the human lineage (phylogeny). The EEM/EET
distinction cuts across this distinction since we may be concerned
either with the ontogenetic or phylogenetic development of, e. g.,
the brain or the ontogenetic or phylogenetic development of norms and
knowledge corpora. One might expect that since current orthodoxy
maintains that biological processes of ontogenesis proceed
differently from the selectionist processes of phylogenesis,
evolutionary epistemologies would reflect this difference. Curiously
enough, however, for the most part they do not. For example, the
theory of "neural Darwinism" as put forth by Edelman (1987) and
Changeaux (1985) offers a selectionist account of the ontogenetic
development of the neural structures of the brain. Karl Popper’s
conjectures and refutations model of the development of human
knowledge is a well known example of a selectionist account which has
been applied both to the ontogenetic growth of knowledge in
individuals as well as the trans-generational (phylogenetic)
evolution of scientific knowledge. B. F. Skinner’s theory of
operant conditioning, which deals with the ontogenesis of individual
behavior, is explicitly based upon the Darwinian selectionist
model. (Skinner 1981)
A third distinction concerns descriptive versus prescriptive
approaches to epistemology and the growth of human
knowledge. Traditionally, epistemology has been construed as a
normative project whose aim is to clarify and defend conceptions of
knowledge, foundations, evidential warrant and justification. Many
have argued that neither the EEM programs nor the EET programs have
anything at all to do with epistemology properly (i. e.,
traditionally) understood. The basis for this contention is that
epistemology, properly understood, is a normative discipline, whereas
the EEM and EET programs are concerned with the construction of
causal and genetic (i.e., descriptive) models of the evolution of
cognitive capacities or knowledge systems. No such models, it is
alleged, can have anything important to contribute to normative
epistemology (e.g., Kim 1988). The force of this complaint depends
upon how one construes the relationship between evolutionary
epistemology and the tradition.
There are three possible configurations of the relationship between
descriptive and traditional epistemologies. (1) Descriptive
epistemologies can be construed as competitors to traditional
normative epistemologies. On this view, both are trying to address
the same concerns and offering competing solutions. Riedl (1984)
defends this position. A standard objection to such approaches is
that descriptive accounts are not adequate to do justice to the
prescriptive elements of normative methodologies. The extent to which
an evolutionary approach contributes to the resolution of traditional
epistemological and philosophical problems is a function of which
approach one adopts (cf. Dretske 1971, Bradie 1986, Ruse 1986,
Radnitsky and Bartley 1987, Kim 1988). (2) Descriptive epistemology
might be seen as a successor discipline to traditional
epistemology. On this reading, descriptive epistemology does not
address the questions of traditional epistemology because it deems
them irrelevant or unanswerable or uninteresting. Many defenders of
naturalized epistemologies fall into this camp (e.g., Munz 1993). (3)
Descriptive epistemology might be seen as complementary to
traditional epistemology. This appears to be Campbell’s view. On
this analysis, the function of the evolutionary approach is to
provide a descriptive account of knowing mechanisms while leaving the
prescriptive aspects of epistemology to more traditional
approaches. At best, the evolutionary analyses serve to rule out
normative approaches which are either implausible or inconsistent
with an evolutionary origin of human understanding.
EEM programs are saddled with the typical uncertainties of
phylogenetic reconstructions. Is this or that organ or structure an
adaptation and if so, for what? In addition, there are the
uncertainties which result from the necessarily sparse fossil record
of brain and sensory organ development. The EET programs are even
more problematic. While it is plausible enough to think that the
evolutionary imprint on our organs of thought influences what and how
we do think, it is not at all clear that the influence is direct,
significant or detectible. Selectionist epistemologies which endorse
a "trial and error" methodology as an appropriate model for
understanding scientific change are not analytic consequences of
accepting that the brain and other ancillary organs are adaptations
which have evolved primarily under the influence of natural
selection. The viability of such selectionist models is an empirical
question which rests on the development of adequate
models. Hull’s (1988) is, as he himself admits, but the first
step in that direction. Cziko (1995) is a manifesto urging the
development of such models (cf. also the evolutionary game theory
modeling approach of Harms 1997). Much hard empirical work needs to
be done to sustain this line of research. Non-selectionist
evolutionary epistemologies, along the lines of Ruse (1986), face a
different range of difficulties. It remains to be shown that any
biological considerations are sufficiently restrictive to narrow down
the range of potential methodologies in any meaningful way.
Nevertheless, the emergence in the latter quarter of the twentieth
century of serious efforts to provide an evolutionary account of
human understanding has potentially radical consequences. The
application of selectionist models to the development of human
knowledge, for example, creates an immediate tension. Standard
traditional accounts of the emergence and growth of scientific
knowledge see science as a progressive enterprise which, under the
appropriate conditions of rational and free inquiry, generates a body
of knowledge which progressively converges on the truth. Selectionist
models of biological evolution, on the other hand, are generally
construed to be non-progressive or, at most, locally so. Rather than
generating convergence, biological evolution produces diversity.
Popper’s evolutionary epistemology attempts to embrace both but
does so uneasily. Kuhn’s "scientific revolutions" account draws
tentatively upon a Darwinian model, but when criticized, Kuhn
retreated. (cf Kuhn 1972, pp 172f with Lakatos and Musgrave 1970,
p. 264) Toulmin (1972) is a noteworthy exception. On his account,
concepts of rationality are purely "local" and are themselves subject to
evolution. This, in turn, seems to entail the need to abandon any sense
of "goal directedness" in scientific inquiry. This is a radical
consequence which few have embraced. Pursuing an evolutionary
approach to epistemology raises fundamental questions about the
concepts of knowledge, truth, realism, justification and
rationality.
The interested reader should consult the
extensive bibliography originally developed by Donald Campbell and
maintained by Gary Cziko at
<http://faculty.ed.uiuc.edu/g-cziko/stb/>.
Every scientific enterprise requires formal and semi-formal models
which allow the quantitative characterization of its objects of
study. The attempt to transform the philosophical study of knowledge
into a scientific discipline which approaches knowledge as a
biological phenomenon is no different. Much of the evolutionary
epistemology literature has been concerned with how to conceive of
knowledge as a natural phenomenon, what difference this would make to
our understanding of our place in the world, and with answering
objections to the project. There are, as well, a number of more
technical projects which attempt to provide the theoretical tools
necessary for a naturalistic epistemology.
In the simplest sort of model, an organism has to deal with an
environment that has two states, S1 and
S2, and has two possible responses
R1 and R2. We suppose that
what the organism does in each state makes a difference to its
fitness. Fitnesses are usually written characterized by a matrix
W.
The individual elements of the matrix Wij are the
fitness consequences of response i in state j. So,
for instance, W21 denotes the fitness
consequences of R2 in S1. If
we let W11 and W22 equal one
and W12 and W21 equal zero,
then there is a clear evolutionary advantage to performing
R1 in S1 and
R2 in S2.
However, the organism must first detect the state of the environment,
and detectors are not in general perfectly reliable. If the organism
responds automatically to the detector, we can use the probabilities
of responses given states to characterize the reliability of the
detector. We write the probability of R1 given
S1 as
Pr(R1|S1). This
allows us to calculate that responding to the detector rather than
always choosing R1 or R2 will
be advantageous just in case the following inequality holds
(cf. Godfrey-Smith 1996):
Pr(R2|S2)
/(1 
Pr(R1|S1))
>
Pr(S1)(W11
W21)/(1Pr(S1))(W22
W12)
This simple model demonstrates that whether or not flexible responses
are adaptive depends on the particular characteristics of the fitness
differences that the responses make, the probability of the various
states of the environment, and the reliability of the detector. The
particular result is calculated assuming that detecting the
environmental state and the flexible response system is free in
evolutionary terms. More complete analyses would include the costs of
these factors.
Static optimization models like the one outlined above can be
extended in several ways. Most obviously, the number of environmental
states and organismic responses can be increased, but there are other
modifications that are more interesting. Signal detection theory,
for instance, models the detectors and cues in more detail. In one
example, a species of "sea moss" detects the presence of predatory
sea slugs via a chemical cue. They respond by growing spines, which
is costly. The cue in this case, the water-borne chemical, comes in a
variety of concentrations, which indicate various levels of
danger. Signal detection theory allows us to calculate the best
threshold value of the detector for the growing of spines.
Static models depict evolutionary processes in terms of fitness costs
and benefits. They are static in the sense that they model no actual
process, but merely calculate the direction of change for different
situations. If fitness is high, a type will increase, if low it will
decrease. When fitnesses are equal, population proportions remain at
stable equilibrium. Dynamic models typically employ the kinds of
calculations involved in static models to depict actual change over
time in population proportions. Instead of calculating whether change
will occur and in what direction, dynamic models follow change.
Population dynamics, sometimes referred to as "replicator dynamics",
offers a tractable way to model the evolution of populations over time
under the kinds of selective pressures that can be characterized by
static optimization models. This is often necessary, since the
dynamics of such populations are often difficult to predict purely on
the basis of static considerations of payoff differences. The
so-called "replicator dynamics" were named by Taylor and Jonker
(1978) and generalized by Schuster and Sigmund (1983) and Hofbauer
and Sigmund (1988). They trace their source back to the seminal work
of R.A. Fisher in the 1920’s and 30’s. The generalization
covers evolutionary models used in population genetics, evolutionary
game theory, ecology, and the study of prebiotic evolution. The
models can be implemented either mathematically or computationally,
and can model either stepwise (discrete) or continuous evolutionary
change.
Population dynamics models the evolution of populations. A population
is a collection of individuals, which are categorized according to
type. The types in genetics are genes, in evolutionary game theory,
strategies. The types of interest in epistemological models would be
types of cognitive apparatuses, or cognitive strategies -- ways of
responding to environmental cues, ways of manipulating
representations, and so forth. Roughly, EEM models focus on the
inherited and EET models focus on the learned. The evolution of the
population consists in changes of the relative frequency of the
different types within the population. Selection, typified by
differential reproductive success, is represented as follows. Each
type has a growth rate or "fitness", designated by w, and a
frequency designated by p. The frequency of type i
at the next generation
pi
is simply
the old frequency multiplied by the fitness and divided by the mean
fitness of the population
"
".
pi
=
pi
wi /
Division by has the effect of
"normalizing" the frequencies, so that they add up to one after each
is multiplied by its fitness. It also makes evident that the
frequency of a type will increase just in case its fitness is higher
than the current population average.
Fitness
Fitnesses, which should be understood simply as the aggregation of
probable-growth factors that drive the dynamics of large
populations, may depend on a variety of factors. Fitness
components differ from variation components in that they affect
population frequencies proportionally to those frequencies, that is
to say, multiplicatively. Fitness component in biological evolution
include mortality and reproductive rate. In cultural evolution, they
include transmission probability and rejection probability. Within
either sort of model, what matters is how fitnesses change as a
result of other changing factors within the model. In the simplest
cases, fitnesses are fixed and the type with the highest fitness
inevitably dominates the population. In more complex cases, fitnesses
may depend on variable factors like who one plays against, or the
state of a variable environment. Most commonly, variable fitnesses
are calculated using a payoff matrix like the one above. In general,
to calculate the expected fitness of a type, one multiplies the
fitness a type would have in each situation times the likelihood that
individuals in the population will confront that situation and adds
the resulting products.
wi
=
SA
Pr(A)WiA
where WiA is type i’s fitness in
situation A. This sort of calculation assumes that the effects of the
various situations are additive. More complex situations can be
modeled, of course, but additive matrices are the standard. It should
be noted, however, that matrix-driven evolution can exhibit quite
complex behavior. For instance, chaotic behavior is possible with as
few as four strategies (Skyrms 1992).
Some relationships may be represented without a matrix. Boyd and
Richerson (1985), for instance, were interested in a special kind of
frequency dependent transmission bias in culture, where being common
conferred an advantage due to imitators "doing as the Romans do." In
such a case, the operative fitness of the type is just the fitness as
calculated according to the usual factors, and then modified as a
function of the frequency of the type.
Continuity and Computation
The conceptual bases of replicator dynamics are quite
straightforward. Getting results typically requires one of two
approaches. In order to prove more than rudimentary mathematical
results, one typically needs to derive a continuous version of the
dynamics. The basic form is
dpi/dt
=
p(wi
)
with fitnesses calculated as usual. Mathematical approaches have
been quite productive, though the bulk of theoretical results apply
primarily to population genetics. See Hofbauer and Sigmund (1988) for
a compendium of such results, as well as a reasonable graduate-level
introduction to the mathematical study of evolutionary processes.
The second approach is computational. With the increase in power of
personal computers, computational implementation of evolutionary
models become increasingly attractive. They require only rudimentary
programming skills, and are in general much more flexible in the
assumptions they require. The general strategy is to create an array
to hold population frequencies and fitnesses, and then a series of
procedures (or methods or functions) which
- calculate fitnesses,
- update frequencies with the new fitnesses, and
- manage interface details like outputting the new state of the
population to a file or the screen.
A loop then runs the routines in sequence, over and over again. Most
modelers are happy to put their source code on the internet, which is
probably the best place to find it.
Modeling Cultural Evolution
Part of the difficulty in understanding cognitive behavior as the
product of evolution is that there are at least three very different
evolutionary processes involved. First, there is the biological
evolution of cognitive and perceptual mechanisms via genetic
inheritance. Second, there is the cultural evolution of languages and
concepts. Third, there is the trial-and-error learning process that
occurs during an individual’s lifetime. Moreover, there is some
reason to agree with Donald T. Campbell that understanding human
knowledge fully will require understanding the interaction between
these processes. This requires that we be able to model both
processes of biological and cultural evolution. There are by now a
number of well-established models of biological evolution. Cultural
evolution presents more novelty.
Perhaps the most popular attempt to understand cultural evolution is
Richard Dawkins’ (1976) invention of the "meme." Dawkins
observed that what lies at the heart of biological evolution is
differential reproduction. Evolution in general was then the
competitive dynamics of lineages of self-replicating entities. If
culture was to evolve, on this view, there had to be cultural
"replicators", or entities whose differential replication in culture
constituted the cultural evolutionary process. Dawkins dubbed these
entities "memes", and they were characterized as informational
entities which infect our brains, "leaping from head to head" via
what we ordinarily call imitation. Common examples include infectious
tunes, and religious ideologies. The main difficulty with this
approach has been with providing specifications for the basic
entities. The identity conditions of genes can be given, in theory,
in terms of sequences of base pairs in chromosomes. There appears to
be no such fundamental "alphabet" for the items of cultural
transmission. Consequently, the project of "memetics" as contending
basis for evolutionary epistemology is on hold pending an adequate
understanding of its basic ontology.
[See the online
Journal of Memetics
for more information.]
Population models have been used to good effect in modeling cultural
transmission processes. Evolutionary game theory models are
frequently claimed to cover both processes in which strategies are
inherited and those in which they are imitated. This application is
possible in the absence of any specification of the underlying nature
of strategies, for instance, whether they are to be thought of as
"things" which are replicated, or whether they are properties or
states of the individuals whose strategies they are. This is
sometimes referred to as the "epidemiological approach", though
again, the comparison to infection is due to the quantitative tools
used in analysis rather than to any presupposition regarding
the underlying ontology of cultural transmission.
The kind of levels involved in evolutionary epistemology are quite
different than the kind of levels of selection which are discussed
much more often in the "levels of selection" debate in evolutionary
biology. In evolutionary biology, the "levels" of selection under
discussion are levels of scale. The debate concerns whether genes are
always the "units" or "targets" of selection, or whether selection
can occur on higher levels, like organisms, groups, and species. The
levels involved in evolutionary epistemology, on the other hand, are
levels of the regulatory hierarchy involved in the control of
behavior. These include the genetic bases of cognitive and perceptual
hardware, concepts, languages, techniques, beliefs, preferences, and
so forth. Note that in the case of evolutionary epistemology, the
terms "levels" and "hierarchy" may be impressionistic. There is often
no clear arrangement of levels at all.
There are at least two different approaches that have been taken to
modeling multi-level evolution.
- Dual Transmission Models: Boyd and Richerson (1985) adapted models
from genetics to model a case in which a trait (cooperation) was
affected both by genetic and cultural evolution. It was first shown
that a genetically determined bias on cultural transmission could be
selected for in a migratory population. The bias made it easier to pick
up local customs, increasing the likelihood of imitation beyond that
determined by the frequency and perceived value of the behavior. Once
this bias was in place, its effect was strong enough to overcome the
perceived costs involved in cooperative behavior. The model yielded two
important results. First, it provided a novel mechanism according to
which cooperative behavior can stabilize in migratory populations. But
more importantly, it demonstrated that cultural evolution cannot be
predicted purely on the basis of genetic fitnesses.
- Multiple Population Models: Harms (1997) constructed a multi-level
dynamic population model of bumblebee learning. Mutual information
between distributions of sensor types, overt foraging behaviors, and
internal foraging preferences on the one hand and environmental states
on the other was assessed and compared to average fitness of the
population states. It was shown that information present in overt
behaviors may be underutilized, and that exaptation of sensor
mechanisms for preference formation can bring about the utilization of
that information.
Full descriptive accounts of truth and justification both demand a
theory of meaning. Until a sign has meaning, it cannot be true or
false. Moreover, determining the meaning of justificatory claims may
provide a descriptive theory of justification. Presumably, what makes
a claim of justification true is the basis of that justification. If
meaning is conventional, then the evolution of meaning becomes an
instance of the evolution of conventions.
Models of the evolution of conventions have in one case been
extended to apply to meaning conventions. Skyrms (1996, chapter 5) gave
an evolutionary interpretation of David Lewis’ (1969) model of
rational selection of meaning conventions. Skyrms was able to show that
there is strong selection on the formation of "signaling systems" in
mixed populations with a full set of coordinated, countercoordinated,
and uncoordinated strategies. It is significant that the structure of
the model and the selective process by which meaning conventions emerge
and are stabilized largely parallels the account of the evolution of
meaning given by Ruth Millikan (1984).
In the simplest version, the model is constructed as follows: We
imagine that there are two states of affairs T, two acts
A, and two signals M. Players have an equal chance
of being in either the position of sender, or receiver. Receivers
must decide what to do based purely on what the sender tells them. In
this purely cooperative version, each player gets one point if the
receiver does A1 if the state is
T1 or A2 if the state is
T2.
Since players will be both sender and receiver, they must have a
strategy for each situation. There are sixteen such strategies, and
we suppose them to be either inherited (or learned) from biological
parents, or imitated on the basis of perceived success in terms of
points earned. Strategies I1 and
I2 are signaling systems, in that if both players
play the same one of these two strategies they will always get their
payoff. I3 and I4 are
anti-signaling strategies, which result in consistent
miscoordination, though they do well against each other. All of the
other strategies involve S3,
S4, R3, or
R4, which results in the same act being performed
no matter what the external state is.
Sender Strategies:
| S1: |
Send M1 if T1;
M2 if T2 |
| S2: |
Send M2 if
T1;M1 if T2 |
| S3: |
Send M1 if T1 or
T2 |
| S4: |
Send M2 if T1 or
T2 |
Receiver Strategies:
| R1: |
Do A1 if M1;
A2 if M2 |
| R2: |
Do A2 if M1; A1
if M2 |
| R3: |
Do A1 for M1 or
M2 |
| R4: |
Do A2 for M1 or
M2 |
Complete Strategies:
| I1: |
S1,R1 |
| I2: |
S2,R2, |
| I3: |
S1,R2 |
| I4: |
S2,R2 |
| I5: |
S1,R3 |
| I6: |
S2,R3 |
| I7: |
S1,R4 |
| I8: |
S2,R4 |
| I9: |
S3,R1 |
| I10: |
S3,R2 |
| I11: |
S3,R3 |
| I12: |
S3,R4 |
| I13: |
S4,R1 |
| I14: |
S4,R2 |
| I15: |
S4,R3 |
| I16: |
S4,R4 |
Simulation results showed that virtually all initial population
distributions become dominated by one or the other of the two
signaling system strategies. The situation becomes more complex when
more realistic payoffs are introduced, for instance, that the sender
incurs a cost rather than automatically sharing the benefit that the
receiver gets from correct behavior for the environment. Even in such
situations, however, the most likely course of evolution is
domination by a signaling system.
- Bradie, Michael(1986), "Assessing Evolutionary Epistemology," in
Biology & Philosophy 1, 401-459.
- Bradie, Michael(1994),
"Epistemology from an Evolutionary Point of View." In Conceptual
Issues in Evolutionary Biology, edited by Elliott Sober, 453- 475.
Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
- Bradie, Michael. (1989),
"Evolutionary Epistemology as Naturalized Epistemology." In Issues
in Evolutionary Epistemology, edited by K. Hahlweg and C. A.
Hooker, 393-412. Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
- Boyd, Robert, and Peter J. Richerson (1985), Culture and the
Evolutionary Process, Chicago: The University of Chicago Press,
299 pp.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1956a),
"Adaptive Behavior from Random Response." Behavioral Science
1, no. 2: 105-110.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1956b),
"Perception as Substitute Trial and Error." Psychological
Review 63, no. 5: 331- 342.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1959),
"Methodological Suggestions from a Comparative Psychology of Knowledge
processes." Inquiry 2: 152-182.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1960),
"Blind Variation and Selective Retention in Creative Thought as in
Other Knowledge Processes." Psychological Review 67, no. 6:
380-400.
- Campbell, Donald T. (1974),
"Evolutionary Epistemology." In The philosophy of Karl R.
Popper, edited by P. A. Schilpp, 412-463. LaSalle, IL: Open Court.
- Campbell, Donald T.(1974b),
"Unjustified Variation and Selective Retention in Scientific
Discovery." In Studies in the philosophy of biology, edited by
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epistemology: naturalized |
game theory: evolutionary |
information |
teleology: teleological notions in biology
Copyright © 2001 by
Michael Bradie
mbradie@bgnet.bgsu.edu
and
William Harms
billharms@billharms.com
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First published: January 10, 2001
Content last modified: January 10, 2001