Basic Information

The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy is a dynamic reference work and is a publishing project of the Metaphysics Research Lab at the Center for the Study of Language and Information (CSLI) at Stanford University. The concept of a dynamic reference work was implemented in the design of the Encyclopedia by Edward N. Zalta (Director of the Metaphysics Research Lab). The project began when John Perry was the Director of the Center for the Study of Language and Information. All correspondence should be directed to:

• editors@plato.stanford.edu

Information about our dynamic reference work can be found in the following papers and abstracts:

• "The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy: A Developed Dynamic Reference Work", by Colin Allen, Uri Nodelman, and Edward N. Zalta, forthcoming Metaphilosophy (285K PDF file); to be reprinted in CyberPhilosophy: The Intersection of Philosophy and Computing, James H. Moor and Terrell Ward Bynum, (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell, 2002
• "A Solution to the Problem of Updating Encyclopedias", by Eric Hammer and Edward N. Zalta
  Computers and the Humanities, 31/1 (1997): 47-60 [Note: The ftp-based file upload system described in this paper has been superseded by a browser-based file upload system which uses special password-protected web interfaces for the authors and editors.]
• "Why Philosophy Needs a ‘Dynamic’ Encyclopedia", by John Perry and Edward N. Zalta, URL = <http://plato.stanford.edu/pubs/why.html>, November 1997.
• Abstract, "Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy: A Dynamic Reference Work", in Proceedings of the First ACM/IEEE-CS Joint Conference on Digital Libraries (June 24-28, 2001), New York: Association for Computing Machinery Publications, p. 457
• Abstract, "Digital Workflow Concepts for Dynamic Reference Works", abstract of talk delivered at the Ancient Studies -- New Technology Conference, Salve Regina University, December 2000

Principal Editor:

Edward N. Zalta (CSLI, Stanford University)

Associate Editor:

Colin Allen (Philosophy/Texas A&M University)

Assistant Editor:

Uri Nodelman (Computer Science/Stanford University)

Advisory Board:

Department of Philosophy, Stanford University

Editorial Board/Subject Editors

List of Authors

Occasional Referees

Information for Authors:

• Entry Content: Guidelines and Policies
• HTML Editors and Web Authoring Tools
  • (create HTML easily without editing HTML sourcefiles directly)
• HTML Guides and OnLine Help for Writing HTML
  • (for editing HTML sourcefiles directly)

Editorial Policies:

1. All editorial decisions concerning the Encyclopedia, including decisions concerning its content, format and distribution, are made by the Editor in consultation with the Board of Editors.
2. The members of the Board of Editors are selected in consultation with the Stanford Department of Philosophy, which serves as the Encyclopedia's Advisory Board. The Advisory Board also advises the Editor on the basic policies governing the operation of the Encyclopedia.
3. Contributions to the Encyclopedia are normally solicited by invitation from a member of the Board of Editors. However, qualified potential contributors may send an inquiry to an appropriate member of the Editorial Board containing an entry proposal and a description of their qualifications. Those persons who have published refereed works on the proposed entry are qualified to submit proposals. By `refereed works' we mean either articles in respected, refereed journals or books which have been published by respected publishing houses and which have undergone the usual peer review process prior to publication. Notes in newsletters, proceedings, unpublished dissertations, etc., do not count as much. However, if a member of our Board of Editors is familiar with the work of the potential contributor, the latter may be certified as qualified. The Board of Editors reserves the right to compare the qualifications of the person submitting the unsolicited request with those of other potential authors who might naturally come to mind for the entry in question.
4. Readers of the Encyclopedia are also encouraged to contact authors directly with comments, corrections, and other suggestions for improvements.
5. It remains the responsibility of authors to maintain their entries and to keep them current. Authors are expected: (1) to update their entries regularly, especially in response to important new research on the topic of the entry, and (2) to revise their entries in a timely way in light of any valid criticism they receive, whether it comes from the subject editors on our Editorial Board, other members of the profession, or interested readers. In connection with (1), authors should update the Bibliography and Other Internet Resources sections of their entries regularly, to keep pace with significant new publications, both in print and on the web. In connection with (2), the validity of criticism shall be determined by the Editor, typically in consultation with the relevant members of the Editorial Board. The length of time required for a "timely" revision will be negotiable and will both respect the author's current commitments and reflect the seriousness of the criticism. However, entries which require revision but which are not revised within the negotiated timetable may be retired from the active portion of the Encyclopedia and left in the Encyclopedia Archives until such time as the entry is revised so as to engage the valid criticisms in question.
6. The views expressed by the authors in their entries are their own and do not necessarily reflect those of Stanford University, the Stanford University Philosophy Department, the Encyclopedia's Editor or of anyone else associated with the Encyclopedia.

Copyright Information

Copyright Notice. Authors contributing an entry or entries to the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy retain copyright to their entry or entries but grant to the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University an exclusive license to publish their entry or entries on the Internet and the World Wide Web, including any future technologies or media that develop to supplement or replace the Internet or World Wide Web. All rights not expressly granted to the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University, including the right to publish an entry or entries in other print media, are retained by the authors. Copyright of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy itself is held by the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University. All rights are reserved. No part of the Encyclopedia (excluding individual contributions and works derived solely from those contributions, for which rights are reserved by the individual authors) may be reprinted, reproduced, stored, or utilized in any form, by any electronic, mechanical, or other means, now known or hereafter invented, including printing, photocopying, saving (on disk), broadcasting or recording, or in any information storage or retrieval system, other than for purposes of fair use, without written permission from the copyright holder. (All communications should be directed to the Principal Editor.)

Licensing Agreement. By contributing to the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy authors grant to the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University a perpetual, exclusive, worldwide right to copy, distribute, transmit and publish their contribution on the Internet and World Wide Web. The authors also grant to the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University a perpetual, non-exclusive, worldwide right to copy, distribute, transmit and publish any and all derivative works prepared or modified by the Editor from the original contribution, in whole or in part, by any variety of methods on all types of publication and broadcast media other than the Internet, now known or hereafter invented. Authors also grant to the Metaphysics Research Lab at Stanford University a perpetual, non-exclusive, worldwide right to translate their contribution, as well as any modified or derivative works, into any and all languages for the same purposes of copying, distributing, transmitting and publishing their work.

Statement of Liability. By contributing to the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy authors grant, to the Principal Editor, the Associate Editor, the Assistant Editor, members of the Advisory and Editorial Boards, the Metaphysics Research Lab, CSLI, and Stanford University, immunity from all liability arising from their work. All authors are responsible for securing permission to use any copyrighted material, including graphics, quotations, and photographs, within their contributions. The Principal Editor, Associate Editor, Assistant Editor, members of the Advisory and Editorial Boards, CSLI, and Stanford University therefore disclaim any and all responsibility for copyright violations and any other form of liability arising from the content of the Encyclopedia or from any material linked to the Encyclopedia. Alleged copyright violations should be brought to the attention of the author and the Principal Editor, so that such issues may be dealt with promptly.

Acknowledgements:

The Editor would like to acknowledge the special programming expertise of Eric Hammer, when the Encyclopedia was in its initial design stages. We'd also like to thank David Barker-Plummer, Mark Greaves, Emma Pease, Susanne Riehemann, and Nathan Tawil for their helpful suggestions concerning the Encyclopedia project and the construction of this Web site.

The Editor would also like to acknowledge the South Korean company C.O.Tech, Inc., for their expert advice concerning XML and for programming a Java-based XML/XHTML editing program for use by the authors of the Encyclopedia.

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