Actualism

To answer this question, a philosopher should try to identify the special features of the world that are responsible for the truth of claims about what could have been been the case. One group of philosophers, the possibilists, offer the following answer: ‘It is possible that there are Aliens’ is true because there are in fact individuals that could have been Aliens. By hypothesis, however, such individuals are simply possible and not actual. No actually existing thing could possibly have been an Alien. Hence, the truth of ‘It is possible that there are Aliens’ is, according to possibilism, grounded in the fact that there are possible-but-nonactual Aliens, i.e., things that are not actual but which could have been, and such that, moreover, if they had been actual, they would have been Aliens.

Actualists reject this answer; they deny that there are any nonactual individuals. Actualism is the philosophical position that everything there is -- everything that can be said to exist in any sense -- is actual. Put another way, actualism denies that there is any kind of being beyond actuality; to be is to be actual. Actualism therefore stands in stark contrast to possibilism, which, as we've seen, takes the things there are to include possible but non-actual objects.

Of course, actualists will agree that there could have been Aliens. Actualism, therefore, can be thought of as the metaphysical theory that attempts to account for the truth of claims like ‘It is possible that there are Aliens’ without appealing to any nonactual objects whatsoever. What makes actualism so philosophically interesting, is that there is no obviously correct way to account for the truth of claims like ‘It is possible that there are Aliens’ without appealing to possible but nonactual objects. In the rest of this article, we will lay out the various attempts to do so in some detail and assess their effectiveness.

• 1. The Possibilist Challenge to Actualism
  • 1.1 Worlds
  • 1.2 Mere Possibilia
  • 1.3 Where We Go From Here
• 2. The Simplest Quantified Modal Logic (SQML)
  • 2.1 Controversial Consequences of SQML
  • 2.2 Why Actualists Find SQML Objectionable
• 3. Kripke's System
  • 3.1 Kripke Models
  • 3.2 Kripke's Quantified Modal Logic
• 4. Is Kripke's System Actualist?
• 5. Actualist Responses to the Possibilist Challenge
  • 5.1 Individual Essences
  • 5.2 World Stories
  • 5.3 World Propositions
  • 5.4 Roles
  • 5.5 Dispensing with Worlds
  • 5.6 An Actualist Interpretation of the Simplest Quantified Modal Logic
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. The Possibilist Challenge to Actualism

(A)	Everything that exists (i.e., everything there is) is actual.

The possibilist challenge to actualism is to give an analysis of our ordinary modal beliefs which is consistent with Thesis (A), i.e., which doesn't appeal to possible but nonactual objects. There are two central aspects to the possibilist challenge: the challenge of possible worlds, and the challenge of possible objects. The latter will be the central focus of this article, but, for the sake of completeness, we begin with a brief discussion of the former.

1.1 Worlds

(a) The statement ‘It is necessary that p’ (‘p’) is true just in case p is true in all possible worlds.

(b) The statement ‘It is possible that p’ (‘p’) is true just in case p is true in some possible world.

On the face of it, then, the possible worlds analysis of basic modal statements just sketched appears to entail the existence of nonactual possible worlds, and hence appears directly to contradict Thesis (A). Consequently, actualists either have to try to develop a semantics for modal statements in terms that do not entail the existence of nonactual possible worlds, or at least to provide an account of possible worlds on which this consequence is rendered metaphysically innocuous.

The power of the possible worlds semantics -- and the distinct lack of any persuasive alternatives -- is very attractive to many actualists, and they are loathe to give it up (so long, of course, as they do not have to abandon actualism). Consequently, actualists typically grasp the second horn of the above dilemma and adopt some sort of actualistically acceptable, "sanitized" version of this theory on which possible worlds are conceived as theoretical abstract objects which actually exist. Many such theories of abstractly-conceived worlds have been developed, some with better success than others (see, for example, Plantinga [1974] and [1976], Chisholm [1976], Fine [1977], Adams, [1974], van Inwagen [1986], or Zalta [1983] and [1993]). Some take worlds to be maximal possible states of affairs, others take them to be maximal possible properties or propositions, still others treat them as maximal consistent sets of some sort, and yet others treat them as part of a more general theory of abstract objects. For purposes here, it will serve well enough just to assume some generic version of this view on which such abstractly conceived worlds can perform their theoretical tasks in virtue of certain actualistically unobjectionable modal properties. A detailed version of such an account, and some of its philosophical ramifications, can be found in the supplementary document on An Account of Abstract Possible Worlds.

1.2 Mere Possibilia

Now consider the modal claim ‘There could have been Aliens’. It is natural to regiment this claim as "It is possible that there exists an x such that x is an Alien", which is typically formalized as follows:

(1)

xAx.

(2)	There exists a possible world w and there exists an individual x such that x is an Alien at w.

(3)	There exists an individual x and there exists a possible world w such that x is an Alien at w.

(4)

xAx

(5)	It is possible that there exists an x such that x is an Alien.
(6)	There exists an x such that it is possible that x is an Alien.

Since it seems reasonable to want to hang on to such ordinary modal beliefs as (5), there is an apparent incompatibility between the simplest quantified modal logic and actualism. This is only the tip of the iceberg, however, for the problem described in the previous paragraph resurfaces each time we ‘nest’ or ‘iterate’ modalities. Consider, for example, the following sentences:

(7)	The Pope (i.e., Karol Wojtyla) could have had a son who could have become a priest.
(8)	There could be a planet disturbing the orbit of Pluto and it could have a period of n years.

(9)	x(Sxp & Px)
(10)	x(Lx & Dxp & Pxn)

1.3 Where We Go From Here

The remaining sections of this essay, therefore, contain the following material. In Section 2, we describe, in a precise way, both the characteristics of the simplest quantified modal logic and its controversial theorems. (As we acquire more sophisticated logical tools, we will revisit some of the examples already discussed; the redescription of these examples in more sophisticated logical terms may prove to be instructive.) We also show why each of the controversial theorems is objectionable from the standpoint of actualism. In Section 3, we outline a modal system developed by Saul Kripke that appears to be consistent with Thesis (A). However, in Section 4, we'll discover that Kripke's system introduces special problems of its own. Finally, in Section 5, we discuss the various attempts actualists have made to work within a Kripke-style framework to solve these problems and to find a metaphysical theory of necessity and possibility which is consistent with Thesis (A). However, we will also examine the attempts of some actualists who have recently discovered a new interpretation of the simplest quantified modal logic which is consistent with Thesis (A).

2: The Simplest Quantified Modal Logic

The simplest semantics for the language L defines a class of interpretations having two distinguishing features: (1) each interpretation I in the class has just two, mutually exclusive domains--a nonempty domain of possible worlds (which includes a distinguished "actual world" w₀) and a nonempty domain of individuals, and (2) given any individuals i₁,..., i_n in the domain and given any possible world w, each interpretation I specifies, for each n-place predicate ‘R’, whether ‘R’ applies to i₁,..., i_n at w or not. Given that specification, the semantics then defines truth conditions for every formula of the language. The definition of truth even accommodates ‘open formulas’ (i.e., formulas with free variables) by appealing to assignment functions f which assign to each variable x some member f(x) of the domain of individuals. Moreover, given any interpretation I and assignment function f to the variables, a denotation function d relative I and f is defined for the terms (constants and variables) of the language. When is a constant, d_I,f() is the individual in the domain that I assigns to . When is a variable, d_I,f() is f().

The semantic notion ‘ is true (under interpretation I and assignment f) at world w’ (‘true_I,f at w’) is then defined recursively for all of the formulas of the language. The three mosts important parts of this definition for quantified modal logic are the clauses for atomic, quantified, and modal formulas. Here are examples of each:

1. The open, atomic formula ‘Px’ is true_I,f at w just in case I specifies that ‘P’ applies to d_I,f(x) at w.
2. The quantified formula ‘xPx’ is true_I,f at w just in case, for all individuals a, ‘Px’ is true_I,f[x,a] at w, where f[x,a] is f if f(x) = a, and otherwise is just like f except that it assigns a to x instead of f(x). (A little less formally, ‘xPx’ is true_I,f at w just in case, for all individuals a, the predicate ‘P’ applies to a at w.)
3. The open, modal formula ‘Px’ is true_I,f at w just in case for every possible world w, ‘Px’ is true_I,f at w.

The simplest quantified modal logic (SQML) systematizes the logically true sentences of L relative to the simplest semantics. SQML combines the logical axioms and rules of inference from classical propositional logic, classical first-order quantification theory, the logic of identity, and S5 modal logic. We presuppose here that the laws of classical first-order logic with identity are known. The system S5 (aka KT5) adds three axioms to classical first-order logic with identity--the K axiom, the T axiom, and the 5 axiom (see below)--and adds the Rule of Necessitation (RN) (which states that whenever is a theorem, so is ). Each of the logical axioms of the resulting SQML is true in every interpretation in the class described in the previous paragraph. Moreover, the rules of inference ‘preserve truth’ (and preserve logical truth). That is, the rules of inference permit one to infer only (logical) truths from any set of premises consisting solely of (logical) truths. Notice that open formulas are assertible as axioms and provable as theorems in SQML. For convenience, we reproduce these in the supplementary document The Simplest Quantified Modal Logic. Familiarity with this logic will be presupposed in what follows.

The problem that SQML poses for actualist philosophers is that whereas all of the logical axioms appear to be true, some of the logical consequences of these axioms appear to be false. Consider first the fact that the new modal axioms added by SQML to classical first-order logic, i.e., the K, T, and 5 axioms, all seem true. The K axiom asserts that if a conditional is necessary, then if the antecedent is necessary, so is the consequent:

K axiom: () ()

The ‘T’ axiom asserts that a formula true in every possible world is simply true:

T axiom:

The ‘5’ axiom asserts that if a formula is possible, then it is necessarily the case that it is possible:

5 axiom:

2.1 Controversial Consequences of SQML

BF:	x x
NE:	xy y=x
CBF:	x x

The Barcan Formula is Logically True
The ‘Necessary Existence’ Principle is Logically True
The Converse Barcan Formula is Logically True

Proof of the Barcan Formula in S5
Proof of ‘Necessary Existence’ in S5
Proof of Converse Barcan Formula in S5

x x

2.2 Why Actualists Find SQML Unacceptable

... BF requires that there exists something that is possibly b's sister. Since b has no sisters, which existing object is it that is possibly b's sister? Some actualists, notably Ruth Marcus [1986], might defend BF by pointing to an existing woman (possibly one closely related to b) and suggesting that she is the thing which both exists and which is possibly b's sister. But the great majority of actualists don't accept this idea, for they subscribe to certain essentialist views about the nature of objects. For example, they believe that women who aren't b's sister could not have been (in a metaphysical sense) b's sister. This is a fact about their very nature, one concerning their origins. ... Since there seems to be no actually existing thing which is possibly b's sister, they conclude BF is false. We think the essentialist intuitions leading to this conclusion are not unreasonable, and so understand why these actualists take BF to be false. Indeed, it seems that BF, in general, is incompatible with the intuition that there might have been something distinct from every actual thing. It is hard to see how that intuition could be compatible with a principle which seems to require that every possibility be grounded in something that exists. This is further evidence actualists have against the acceptability of BF. But since they still want to make sense of modal discourse in terms of possible world semantics, they reject the Barcan formula as having unacceptable consequences, and search for a modal semantics on which it is not valid.

Consider next NE. For actualists, this explicitly says that for any object x, necessarily something exists that is identical with x. Now most actualists accept the following definition of what it is for an object to exist:

x exists =_df y(y = x)

Another problem with NE is that it leads to an even stronger result. By applying the Rule of Generalization and then the Rule of Necessitation to NE, one obtains:

NNE:

xy y=x

x is contingent =_df y(y = x)

xy(y = x)

xy(y = x)

Finally, there is CBF. For the actualist, the main problem with CBF is that in SQML it implies NE in conjunction with the thesis known as Serious Actualism. Serious Actualism is the thesis that it is not possible for an object to have a property without existing, i.e., that if an object exemplifies a property at a world, it exists at that world. [See Plantinga [1983], [1985], Menzel [1991], Pollock [1985], and Deutsch [1994] for various discussions of Serious Actualism.] In semantic terms, this amounts to the constraint that an object in the extension of a property at a world must fall under the range of the quantifier at that world. Serious Actualism is often expressed by the following schema of the object language:

SA:	[y y=x], where is atomic and contains x.

As noted, Arthur Prior was the first to realize the controversial consequences of SQML. Prior himself was a staunch actualist, and dealt with the problem by developing an alternative quantified modal logic that differs significantly from SQML, and which does not have the controversial principles above as theorems. A more detailed account of Prior's approach can be found in the supplementary document Prior's Modal Logic.

3: Kripke's System

It is illuminating both to see exactly how Kripke was able to construct interpretations on which BF, NE, and CBF are not logically true and to see exactly how Kripke modified the logic of SQML so that these these schemata and sentences are no longer theorems. These techniques will be the subject of the next two subsections.

3.1 Kripke Models

The central semantic difference between Kripke models and interpretations for SQML is that, in a Kripke model, when a quantified formula x is evaluated at a world w, the quantifier ranges only over the objects that exist in the domain of w. Thus, in particular, the sample clause in the definition of truth for quantification above must be revised for Kripke models M as follows, where, again, f is an assignment function:

The quantified formula ‘xPx’ is true_M,f at w just in case, for all individuals a in dom(w), ‘Px’ is true_M,f[x,a] at w, where f[x,a] is f if f(x) = a, and otherwise is just like f except that it assigns a to x instead of f(x).

Kripke's changes to the model theory of first-order modal languages are relatively simple. Nonetheless, unlike the model theory for SQML, Kripke's model theory yields a set of logical truths that is fully compatible with actualism. In particular, all three of the principles with which the actualist takes issue -- BF, NE, and CBF -- turn out to be invalid in Kripke's semantics. Consider first BF in the form

x x

It should be obvious why NE is also invalid in Kripke's semantics: domains of worlds can be empty. Thus, let M₁ be a Kripke model containing at least one actual individual (i.e., at least one object adom(w₀)) and a world w that has an empty domain. Then, obviously, a does not exist in w, and hence ‘y y=x’ is false at w when ‘a’ is assigned to x. Thus, ‘y y=x’ is false at w₀ when a is assigned to ‘x’, and so, because a is in the domain of the actual world w₀, NE (hence also NNE, of course) is false in M₁.

Finally, we note that CBF is invalid in Kripke's semantics. First, let M₂ be a Kripke model in which NE is false. (We just proved the existence of such a model in the previous paragraph, of course.) Next, let the predicate ‘P’ express a property in M₂ that is universal and existence-entailing, that is, a property which is exemplified at each world w by everything that exists at w. (Such a property is said to be existence-entailing because, necessarily, anything that has it exists.  The property existence, of course, is the simplest example of such a property.)  We can represent the universal, existence-entailing character of this property in the predicate ‘P’ formally in M₂ simply by stipulating that the extension of ‘P’ at any world w of M₂ is dom(w), so that all and only the things that exist at each world are in the extension of P at that world. Now, note that, under these conditions, it is true in M₂ (i.e., true at the actual world w₀ of M₂) that xPx: intuitively, everything that exists in every possible world has the property P in that world. Let a be any object in the actual world w₀ that fails to exist in some world w. (Since, by hypothesis, NE fails in M₂, there must be such an object in dom(w₀).) Because P is existence-entailing, a is not in the extension of ‘P’ at w. So there is something in the actual world w₀ that does not have the property P in every possible world, i.e., ‘xPx’ is false in M₂. Hence, the instance ‘xPxxPx’ of CBF is false in M₂.

Note that the invalidity of CBF opens the door back up to serious actualism (SA) in Kripke's semantics, as it was the combination of SA with CBF that led to trouble (i.e., trouble for the actualist) in SQML. And it is easy to see formally that this is the case by constructing a Kripke model in which SA is true. Note first that the thesis of serious actualism can be expressed as the thesis that all properties are existence-entailing; there is no possible world in which something has a property but fails to exist in that world. In first-order languages, properties are represented by predicates, and having a property is represented semantically by being in the extension of a predicate. Thus, to represent a property as existence-entailing in a Kripke model, one simply ensures that, at every possible world w, the extension of the predicate representing that property consist only of things that exist in w. Hence, to represent all properties as existence entailing, and hence, to make SA true, one ensures that this is so for all the predicates of one's language. Formally, then, let M₃ be any Kripke model satisfying the condition that, for every n-place predicate F and world w, F is interpreted so that, at w, F applies only to things that exist in w; more formally, for individuals i₁, ... , i_n of M₃, F applies to i₁, ... , i_n at w only if i₁, ... , i_ndom(w). This condition ensures that SA is true in M₃.

The compatibility of SA with Kripke's semantics is yet further evidence of its suitability as a formal semantics for the actualist. A question that remains is: What sort of logic does this semantics yield?

3.2 Kripke's Quantified Modal Logic

SQML is sound and complete relative to the semantics given for its language L above. Since BF, NE, and CBF are invalid in Kripke's semantics, SQML is obviously not sound and complete for it; more specifically, it is not sound: some of SQML's theorems--notably, BF, NE, and CBF--are not valid, as we saw in the previous section. Hence, Kripke must modify SQML to block their derivation without blocking the derivation of any valid formulas.

The key element to Kripke's solution to this problem is the generality interpretation of free variables. The proof of NE in SQML relies crucially on the ability to derive theorems involving free variables, and more specifically on the application of the rule of Necessitation to such theorems. As described in the supplementary document Proof of ‘Necessary Existence’ in S5, the proof makes use of the following instances of logical axioms:

• x=x
• y yx xx.

x=x

y y=x

y y=x.

y y=x

To repair this "flaw" in SQML, Kripke proposes no changes to SQML other than this: a formula containing free variables x₁,..., x_n, when asserted as a theorem (and hence, in particular, as an axiom), is taken to be an abbreviation for its universal closure x₁...x_n. Thus, under this proposal, the axioms used in the proof of NE noted above are no longer assertible as theorems (they cannot appear in the lines of a proof) --- they must be taken to be abbreviations of:

• x x=x
• x[y yx xx]

x(x=x y y=x)

x x=x xy y=x

xy y=x

xy y=x

xy y=x

xy y=x.

The failure of those particular proofs, of course, does not mean that the principles in question cannot be proved some other way. However, Kripke guarantees their unprovability in his system by showing that the system is sound and complete relative to his semantics. Soundness, in particular, tells us that no invalid formula is provable in the system. Hence, since NE, CBF, and BF are all invalid in Kripke's semantics, soundness guarantees that they are all unprovable in his system.

4. Is Kripke's System Actualist?

First, Kripke regards the loss of free variables from assertible sentences as a mere inconvenience. However, much of mathematical reasoning is carried out in terms of sentences with free variables, and one should at least wonder why modal logic, as opposed to classical logic, can't be formulated with free variables in assertible sentences. Far more serious, however, is the fact is that, as the system stands, one cannot add constants for contingent beings. For suppose we add a constant ‘c’ to Kripke's system. As noted in the last section, x x=x xy y=x is a theorem of Kripke's logic. Hence, by the identity axiom x x=x we have xy y=x, and so by universal instantiation it follows that y y=c. However, by necessitation it follows that y y=c, i.e., that c, whatever it may be, is a necessary being. Thus, in Kripke's system as it stands, one cannot consistently assert, e.g., that Socrates is a contingent being, y y=s, surely a seriously undesirable feature in a logic that is intended properly to capture our modal intuitions.

Alarming as this problem might be, it is more a formal rather than a philosophical objection to Kripke's system. Though Kripke himself might not be particularly pleased at the prospect, it seems that the proper response to these problems is simply to alter those features of classical quantification theory and/or classical propositional modal logic that give rise to invalid inferences such as the above. (Arguably, Kripke has already made a similar move in adopting the generality interpretation of free variables.) Obvious suspects here are universal instantiation and necessitation. After all, there is nothing sacrosanct about either classical quantification theory or classical modal logic. If they are inconsistent with strong modal intuitions, then their revision is required and fully warranted.

So its current inability to name contingent beings does not of itself constitute much of an objection to Kripke's system. It is likely that it could be patched up so as to allow it this expressive capacity. Far more serious is the fact that, despite the invalidity and unprovability of the actualistically objectionable principles BF, NE, and CBF, Kripke's system does not appear to have escaped ontological commitment to possibilia. A model theory provides a semantics for a language -- an account of how the truth value of a given sentence of the language is determined in a model by the meanings of its semantically significant component parts, notably, the meanings of its names, predicates, and quantifiers. Now, truth-in-a-model is not the same as truth simpliciter. However, truth simpliciter is usually understood simply to be truth in an intended model, a model consisting of the very things that the language is intuitively understood to be "about". So if we are to take Kripke models seriously as an account of truth for modal languages, then we must identify the intended models of those languages. And for this there seems little option but to take Kripke's talk of possible worlds literally: the set W in an intended Kripke model is the set of all possible worlds. If so, however, it appears that Kripke is committed to possibilia. For suppose the modal operators are literally quantifiers over possible worlds. And suppose it is possible that there be objects -- Aliens, for example -- that are distinct from all actually existing objects. Letting ‘A’ express the property of being an Alien, we can represent this proposition by means of the sentence ‘yAy & xAx’, i.e., while there could be Aliens (yAy), no actually existing thing could be an Alien (xAx). On Kripke's semantics, the first conjunct of this sentence can be true only if there is a possible world w and an object a such that a is an Alien at w. But given the second conjunct, any such object a is distinct from all actually existing things. Hence, using Kripke's semantics to provide us with an account of truth, we find ourselves quantifying directly over possible worlds and mere possibilia. That BF, NE, and CBF are unprovable in Kripke's system, it seems, is metaphysically irrelevant. For it appears that, nonetheless, the semantics itself is wholly committed to possibilism.

An option for the actualist here, perhaps, is simply to deny that Kripke models have any genuine metaphysical bite. The real prize is the logic, which describes the modal facts of the matter directly. The model theory is simply a formal instrument that enables us to prove that the logic possesses certain desirable metatheoretic features, notably consistency. But this position is unsatisfying at best. Consider ordinary "Tarskian" model theory for nonmodal first-order logic. Intuitively, this model theory is more than just a formal artifact. Rather, when one constructs an intended model for a given language, it shows clearly how the semantic values of the relevant parts of a sentence of first-order logic -- the objects, properties, relations, etc. in the world those parts signify -- contribute to the actual truth value of the sentence. The semantics provides insight into the "word-world" connection that explains how it is that sentences can express truth and falsity, how they can carry good and bad information. The embarrassing question for the actualist who would adopt the proposed instrumentalist view of Kripke semantics is: what distinguishes Kripkean model theory from Tarskian? Why does the latter yield insight into the word-world connection and not the former? Distaste for the metaphysical consequences of Kripke semantics at best provides a motivation for finding an answer to these questions, but it is not itself an answer. The actualist owes us either an explanation of how Kripke's model theory provides a semantics for modal languages that does not commit us to possibilism, or else he owes us a semantical alternative.

5. Actualist Responses to the Possibilist Challenge

5.1 Individual Essences

Examples of individual essences are a little harder to come by than examples of essential properties. There are fairly strong intuitive grounds for the thesis that having arisen from the exact sperm and egg that one has is an individual essence of every human person, or at least of every human body. A different sperm and the same egg, say, would have resulted in a perhaps similar but numerically distinct person. Less controversial from a purely logical standpoint are what Plantinga calls haecceities, i.e., properties like being Plantinga, or perhaps, being identical with Plantinga, that are "directly about" some particular object. Pretty clearly, Plantinga has the property being Plantinga essentially -- he could not exist and lack it; any world in which he exists is, ex hypothesi, a world in which he is Plantinga, and hence a world in which he exhibits the property in question. Moreover, nothing but the individual Plantinga could have had that property; necessarily, anything that has it is identical to Plantinga. Hence, being Plantinga is an individual essence. Importantly, Plantinga takes individual essences, like all properties, to exist necessarily, even if they are not exemplified. (Interested readers may wish to read the supplementary document Background Assumptions for Plantinga's Account.)

Briefly put, Plantinga's solution to the possibilist challenge is to replace the possibilia of Kripke's semantics with individual essences. We follow the development of this solution found in Jager [1982]. Specifically, an interpretation I of the first-order modal language L, consists again of two mutually disjoint nonempty sets: the set of possible worlds and the set of individual essences. And, as with Kripke, there is a function dom that assigns to each possible world w its own distinct domain dom(w). However, instead of the possible individuals that exist in w, this domain consists of those individual essences that are exemplified in w, or, more exactly, that would have been exemplified if w had been actual.

But how, exactly, does I assign values to predicates? After all, it is not individual essences to which predicates apply at worlds, it is the things that exemplify them; being an Alien, if it were exemplified, would not be a property of essences, but of individuals. Plantinga's trick is to talk, not about exemplification, but coexemplification. Properties P and Q are coexemplified just in case some individual has both P and Q. And for any world w, P and Q are coexemplified in w just in case, if w were actual, P and Q would be coexemplified. So, for example, given that there are men who are philosophers, the properties being a man and being a philosopher are coexemplified in the actual world. Again, any world in which the pope (i.e., Wojtyla) has a child is a world in which the property being a child of Wojtyla is coexemplified with an individual essence E; any such essence E, of course, is unexemplified in the actual world (assuming the lifelong chastity of the pope).

A relation R is coexemplified with properties P₁,..., P_n (in that order) just in case (i) there are individuals i₁,..., i_n that exemplify P₁,..., P_n, respectively, and (ii) i₁,..., i_n stand in the relation R. And for any world w, R is coexemplified with properties P₁,..., P_n in w just in case, if w were actual, R would be coexemplified with P₁,..., P_n. In Plantinga's system, then, a 1-place predicate P applies to a given individual essence e at a world w just in case the property expressed by P is coexemplified with the e at w. And an n-place predicate R applies to essences e₁,..., e_n at w just in case the relation expressed by R is coexemplified with e₁,..., e_n at w. For any individual essences e₁,..., e_n and possible world w in our interpretation I, then, I specifies, for each n-place predicate R, whether or not R applies to e₁,..., e_n at w.

The denotation function f for I works just as in SQML and Kripke semantics, only now, of course, it assigns essences to variables instead of possibilia. Given this, we can now illustrate the definition of truth for this model theory by means of several instances of its most important clauses:

1. The open, atomic formula ‘Px’ is true_I,f at w just in case I specifies that ‘P’ applies to d_I,f(x) at w.
2. The quantified formula ‘xPx’ is true_I,f at w just in case, for all individual essences e in dom(w), ‘Px’ is true_I,f[x,e] at w, where f[x,e] is f if f(x) = e, and otherwise is just like f except that it assigns e to x instead of f(x). (A little less formally, ‘xPx’ is true_I,f at w just in case, for all individual essences e, the predicate ‘P’ applies to e at w.)
3. The open, modal formula ‘’ (‘’) is true_I,f at w just in case for every (some) possible world w, ‘’ is true_I,f at w.

Notice that Plantinga's account also has no problem dealing with iterated modalities. The problem, recall, was that sentences like

(9) x(Sxp & Px)

In sum, then, in Plantinga's account there is an individual essence for every possibile in Kripke's. And for every property that every possibile enjoys at any given world w in Kripke's account, there is an individual essence that is coexemplified with that property in (the Plantingian counterpart of) w. Plantinga's semantics would thus appear to generate precisely the same truth values for the sentences of a modal language as Kripke's. Hence, it would appear that Plantinga has indeed successfully developed a semantics for modal languages that comports with actualist scruples.

Problems with this Account

5.2 World Stories

Several philosophers -- notably, Robert Adams and, building on work of Prior [1977], Kit Fine -- have developed possible world semantics that are strongly actualist. The approach in Adams [1974] centers around Adams' notion of a possible world, or "world story". For Adams, a world story is a maximally possible set of propositions, that is, a set s of propositions such that (i) for any proposition p, s contains either p or its negation p, and (ii) it is possible that all the memebers of s be true together.^[5]. A proposition p is true in a world story w, then, just in case p is a member of w. Thus, Adams takes a proposition to be possible just in case it is true in some world story. In particular, then, the semantics of our paradigmatic proposition Possibly, there are Aliens, i.e., formally,

(1)

xAx,

(14)	‘xAx’ (i.e., the proposition There are Aliens) is true at some world.

Problems with this Account

5.3 World Propositions

Now, if Fine's account were to parallel Adams', then Fine would now say that, for a proposition to be possible is for it to be true in some possible world, i.e., to be entailed by some world proposition. But Fine is more mindful of the problems that contingent propositions raise for actualism. Consequently, he suggests alternative truth conditions for propositions of the form Possibly p, namely, that it is possible that p be true in some possible world. Thus, for Fine, the full analysis of the iterated modal proposition (9) -- x(Sxp & Px) -- is as follows: (9) is true if and only if

(18)	It is possible that ‘x(Sxp & Px)’ (i.e., the proposition Wojtyla has a son who could have become a priest) is true at some world w.

(19)	It is possible that, for some some individual x, ‘Sxp & Px’ (i.e., the proposition x is a son of Wojtyla and x could have become a priest) is true at some world w,

(20)	It is possible that, for some some individual x, ‘Sxp’ (i.e., the proposition x is a son of Wojtyla) is true at some world w and, it is possible that, for some world u, ‘Px’ (i.e., the proposition x is a priest) is true at u.

Problems with this Account

5.4 Roles

For McMichael, a primitive logical relation of inclusion can hold between properties and relations. Because it is a primitive, it cannot be defined, but, intuitively, in the case of properties, the idea is that one property P includes another Q just in case, necessarily, anything that has P has Q. Thus, the property being red includes the property being colored. Again, intutively once again, one binary relation R includes another R just in case, necessarily, for any objects x and y, if x bears R to y, then x bears R to y. So, for example,the conjunctive relation being both a child and an heir of includes the relation being a child of.

Inclusion can also hold between an n+1-place relation and an n-place relation, relative to one of the argument places of the former.^[6] Thus, in particular, a 2-place relation Q can include a property P, relative to one of its two argument places: intuitively, Q includes P, relative to its first argument place, if and only if, necessarily, whenever two things a and b stand in the relation Q, a exemplifies P. And if the inclusion were with respect to the second argument place, of course, it would be b that exemplifies P. So, for example, the child-of relation, relative to its first argument place, includes the property being a child of something; whenever any object a bears the child-of relation to some object b, a has the existentially quantified property being a child of something. Similarly, child-of includes the property being a parent of something relative to its second argument place.

A (unary) role is just a "purely qualitative" property of a certain sort, where (as described in more detail in the supplementary document on Qualitative Essences) a purely qualitative property is a property that "involves" no particular individuals. Thus, such properties as being a philosopher and being someone's mother or maternal aunt are purely qualitative, while being a student of Quine and being Johnson's mother or a friend of Boswell are not. Given this, McMichael defines a property P to be a unary role if (i) it is exemplifiable, (ii) it is purely qualitative, and (iii) for any purely qualitative property Q, either P includes Q or P includes the complement -Q of Q. A role is thus a complete (nonmodal) "characterization" of the way something could be, qualitatively. Intuitively, then, the role of a given object is a "conjunction" of all of the purely qualitative, nonconjunctive properties the object exemplifies. Thus, for example, Socrates' role includes the properties being a philosopher, being snub-nosed, being the most famous teacher of a famous philosopher, being condemned to death and so on.^[7] The notion of role generalizes in a natural way to all n-place relations, including, notably, propositions (i.e., 0-place relations) and binary (i.e., 2-place) relations. Thus, the binary role that Boswell bears to Johnson is, intuitively, a conjunction of all of the purely qualitative, nonconjunctive binary relations that Boswell bears to Johnson.^[8] As one might suspect, it can be shown on McMichael's theory that a binary role includes a unique unary role with respect to each of its argument places. In particular, the binary role that Boswell bears to Johnson includes Boswell's unary role relative to its first argument place and Johnson's relative to its second.

Now (as also explained in the supplementary document on Qualitative Essences), Adams [1979] has argued persuasively that no purely qualitative property, no matter how complex, can serve as an individual essence for a contingent being. Hence, in general, roles -- being purely qualitative -- are not individual essences. Rather, they are general properties that are (in general) exemplifiable by different things (though not necessarily things in the same possible world). Because of this, none of the objections to Plantinga's haecceities is relevant to roles, as the fact that haecceities are individual essences lies at the heart of those objections. At the same time, McMichael is able to provide a semantics for (9) that does not run afoul of the iterated modalities objection. The basic trick is to

...alter the criterion for deciding what an individual might have done. Instead of saying that what an individual might have done is what he does in some possible world, let us say that what an individual might have done is what any such individual does in some possible world....To determine what Socrates might have done, we don't look for worlds in which he appears, but instead we look for roles in possible worlds which are accessible to Socrates' actual role. If one of these roles includes a certain property, then that property is one Socrates could have had; otherwise, it is not [ibid, 73].

(21)	Possibly, Socrates is foolish (Fs)

Similar to Plantinga's semantics, then, quantifiers do not range over individuals, but over roles. This enables McMichael to avoid the iterated modalities objection and provide a compositional semantics for our iterative paradigm (9). Specifically, (9) is true if and only if

(22)	Some role R accessible to Wojtyla's actual role Rk includes the property being a parent of someone (i.e., the property [y xCxy] expressed by the open formula ‘xCxy’).

xCxy

(23)	Some binary role S that includes the child-of relation (i.e., the relation expressed by the atomic formula ‘Cxy’) also includes, relative to its second argument place, the role R (a role accessible to Wojtyla's actual role Rk).

xCxy

To capture the intuition that no such child could be identical to any actually existing thing, then, McMichael can simply deny that the role R that would be exemplified by such a child is accessible to the role of any actually existing thing.

Problems with this Account

5.5 Dispensing with Worlds

All non-skeptical approaches to modality agree that Kripke models provide key insights into the meaning of our modal discourse and the nature of modal reality. However, as we have seen, the naive "intended" model of Kripke semantics leads to possibilism. The standard actualist response -- following David Lewis, "ersatzism" -- has been to define actualistically acceptable notions of possible worlds and possible individuals to serve as replacements for the elements of W and D in the naive intended model, thereby (or so it is argued) preserving the semantical and metaphysical benefits of Kripke models while avoiding ontological commitment to possibilia. As just seen above, however, ersatzism is still problematic. By contrast, the no-worlds account does not attempt to identify worlds as acceptable abstract entities of some sort. Rather, the notion of a possible world is abandoned altogether.

To get at the idea, note first that the notion of an intended Tarski model makes perfectly good sense for a formalization of nonmodal discourse about the actual world. To illustrate, suppose we have a given a piece of nonmodal discourse about a certain event, a baseball game, say. Suppose now we formalize that discourse in a nonmodal language L; that is, for each referring expression in the disourse (e.g., ‘Mark McGwire’, ‘second inning’, etc.), there is a unique constant of L, and for every simple verb phrase in the discourse (‘is a home run’, ‘is out’, ‘relieves’, etc.) there is a unique predicate of L. Then we can form a Tarski model M_L for L whose domain consists of the actual objects that the speakers are talking about in the discourse (fans, players, equipment, etc.) and which interprets the predicates of L so that they are true of exactly those (n-tuples of objects in the domain that are in the extension of the corresponding verb phrases of the discourse. In this way we form the intended model of L, the piece of the world that it is intended to be about.

According to proponents of the no-worlds account, the fallacy of both ersatzism and possibilism is the inference that things must work in largely the same way with regard to Kripke models. A Kripke model is basically an indexed collection of Tarski models. Just as there is an intended Tarski model for a nonmodal language L constructed from the actual world, the accounts above infer that, for a given formalization L of modal discourse, there must be an intended Kripke model constructed from all possible worlds. And, depending on one's tolerance for possibilia, this leads either to possibilism or one of its ersatz variations.

For no-worlders, the modal upshot of a Kripke model lies in its structure rather than its content. The specific elements of a Kripke model are irrelevant. Rather, under appropriate conditions, it is the form of a Kripke model alone that tells us something about modal reality. Specifically, the model theory of Kripke semantics is retained in the no-world account. The elements of a model are irrelevant; it is easiest just to take them to be pure sets, or ordinal numbers, or some other type of familiar mathematical object. Consequently, there can be no notion of a single intended model, because, for every model, there are infinitely many others that are structurally isomorphic to it, and structure is all that matters on the no-worlds account. In place of intended models, the no-worlds account offers the notion of an intended* model. To get at the idea, suppose one has an intended Tarski model M of the actual world, a model that actually contains entities in the world and assigns extensions to predicates that reflect the actual meanings of the adjectives and verb phrases those predicates formalize. Now replace the objects in that model with abstract objects of some ilk to obtain a new model M that is structurally isomorphic to M. Then M also models the world under a mapping, or embedding, that takes each element e of M to the element e that it replaced in M. We can thus justifiably think of M as a sort of intended model because, even though it doesn't necessary contain anything but pure sets (or some other type of mathematical object), under an appropriate embedding it models the actual world no less than M. To distinguish models like M that require a nontrivial embedding into the world from models like M, we call the former intended* models.

For no-worlders, the notion of an intended* Tarski model is all that is needed for modeling the modal facts. From these a notion of an intended* Kripke model can be defined. Assume that L is a model language that formalizes some range of modal discourse about the world. Roughly, then, an intended* Kripke model M is simply a Kripke model such that (i) the Tarski model indexed by the distinguished index w₀ is an intended* Tarski model of the actual world, (ii) every Tarski model M in M could have been an intended* model of the world, that is, the world could have been as M represents it, and (iii) necessarily, some Tarski model in M is an intended* model of the world, i.e., no matter how the world had been, there would have been an intended* Tarski model of it in M.^[9]

Truth in a model on the the no-worlds account is defined as usual as truth at the distinguish index w₀ of the model, hence, a sentence is true simpliciter if and only if it is true at the distinguished index of some (hence, any) intended* Kripke model. Given the definition of an intended* model, it follows that a modal formula ‘’ is true if and only if, for some intended* Kripke-model M, is true in some Tarski-model M in M, that is, in some Tarski-model M in M that could have been an intended* model of the world. Thus, in particular, (1) is true if and only if

(20)	For some intended* Kripke model M, there is a Tarski model M in M in which ‘xAx’ is true,

For the no-worlder, then, intended* Kripke models adequately represent the modal structure of the world simply by virtue of their own modal properties. Since Kripke models are constructed entirely out of existing objects, the semantics for modal logic requires no distinction between what is actual and what is possible. It therefore conforms with the thesis of actualism, but does so without the elaborate metaphysical apparatus of the ersatzers.

Problems with this Account

5.6 An Actualist Interpretation of the Simplest QML

With this basic idea in hand, the ‘new actualists’ point out that our ordinary modal claims can be given a straightforward analysis by: (1) regimenting ordinary modal discourse in the simplest possible way using the language and logic of the simplest quantified modal logic (SQML) and (2) semantically interpreting SQML by appealing to contingently concrete objects and contingently nonconcrete objects (both of which are assumed to actually exist). This interpretation, the new actualist argues, reveals that the problematic theorems of SQML -- most notably, the Barcan Formula (BF), the Converse Barcan Formula (CBF), and the Necessary Existence (NE) theorems -- do not contradict our modal intuitions, once those intuitions are understood in terms of a more subtle conception of the abstract/concrete distinction.

To see why, reconsider the definition and discussion of SQML and reexamine BF. From the fact that there might have been aliens (xAx), BF requires only that there exist something that could have been an Alien (xAx). But, it was asked, doesn't this contradict the intuition (described at the very outset) that nothing could have been an Alien? Here, the new actualist argues that this intuition is true only when it is properly understood as the intuition that no concrete object could have been an Alien. Recall our thought experiment at the outset, which asked us to "imagine a race of beings that is very different from any life-form that actually exists anywhere in the universe; different enough, in fact, that no actually existing thing could have been an Alien, any more than a given gorilla could have been a fruitfly." The relevant intuition, that nothing could have been an Alien, is grounded in the fact that when we look around us and examine all the concrete objects that there are, we note that none of those objects could have been an Alien (just as no gorilla could have been a fruitfly). However, this leaves room to claim that there exist (contingently) nonconcrete objects which could have been Aliens. According to the new actualist, these contingently nonconcrete objects have been overlooked because (1) no one has correctly drawn the proper distinction between contingently nonconcrete and necessarily nonconcrete objects, and (2) everyone has assumed that concreteness was an essential property of concrete objects (see below).

Thus, according to the new actualist, whenever there is a true claim of the form "There might have been something which is F", BF doesn't imply anything that is incompatible with our modal intuitions. For the conclusion that it forces, namely, that "There exists something that might have been an F", does not require us to suppose that there is some concrete object which might have been F. BF need only require the existence of contingently nonconcrete objects which might have been F. Similar reasoning is developed in the supplementary document Why CBF and NE Are Harmless Consequences of SQML.

Once it is seen that BF requires only contingently nonconcrete objects and not possibilia, it is natural to reconceive the nature of concrete objects. According to new actualism, ordinary concrete objects are concrete at some worlds and not at others. This is the sense in which they are contingent objects. Traditional actualists have described worlds where these objects are not concrete as worlds where these objects don't exist or have any kind of being. By contrast, the new actualist just rests with their nonconcreteness at the world in question, and argues that that should suffice to account for our intuition that such objects "are not to be found" in such a world. Moreover, new actualists reconceive the idea of an "essential" property of a concrete object. Instead of saying that Socrates is essentially a person because he is a person in every possible world where he exists, new actualists say that he is essentially a person because he is a person in every world where he is concrete.

So by recognizing the existence of contingently nonconcrete objects and by reconceiving both the contingency of concrete objects and the notion of an essential property in what seem to be harmless ways, there appears to be a way to interpret SQML so that it is consistent with actualism. Specifically, in the "intended" new actualist model, everything in the one domain D both exists and is actual. D includes: (1) (contingently) concrete objects, (2) necessarily concrete objects (if there are such), (3) contingently nonconcrete objects, and (4) necessarily nonconcrete objects (if there are such). All of these objects in D are said to actually exist.

New actualism appears to lack the awkward features that plague other forms of actualism. In contrast to Kripke's System, the metalanguage does not quantify over possibilia and object language quantifiers can range over everything the metalanguage quantifiers range over. In contrast to Prior's approach, no distinction between two kinds of necessity is needed. In contrast to Plantinga's haecceitism, there is an objectual interpretation of quantified modal logic which is expressible in terms of the basic notion of an individual exemplifying properties (rather than in the less basic terminology of coexemplification). In contrast to Adams' world story approach, there is no puzzle arising from propositions which do not exist at worlds where their constituents do not exist--propositions and their constituents exist necessarily, though the contingent constituents of propositions fail to be concrete at some worlds. In particular, all objects exist necessarily for the new actualist, and hence can be quantified over relative to any possible world, it should be clear that the new actualist has no trouble with the semantics of iterated modalities. (Details are provided in the supplementary document New Actualism and Iterated Modalities for the interested reader.) In contrast to Fine's world propositions approach, object language modal operators are fully interpreted in terms of worlds alone, and hence can be thought of as providing a genuine semantical analysis of the modal operators -- although, admittedly, this will depend on a conception of worlds that does not itself involve a primitive notion of propositional possibility. At the least, the account provides as much explanatory power as Fine's in a manner that is both ontologically simpler and more direct. In contrast to McMichael's role theory, modal truths such as "Socrates might have been a carpenter" are genuinely about Socrates. In contrast to the no-worlders, the idea that necessary truth is truth in all possible worlds is preserved. The intended interpretation has in its domain all of the objects that actually exist and extensions can be distributed to properties at the various worlds in just the way that is required by the modal facts. Modal discourse, then, is directly about an independent reality free of possibilia, and the relationship between the formal language and the intended model exactly mirrors the relationship between ordinary modal language and the reality that grounds modal truth.

Problems with this Account

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