Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Aristotle's Psychology
The Subordinate Psychic Faculties of Imagination and Desire
Imagination
Aristotle sometimes recognizes as a distinct capacity, on par with
perception and mind, imagination (phantasia) (De Anima
iii 3, 414b33-415a3). Although he does not discuss it at length,
or even characterize it intrinsically in any detailed way, Aristotle
does take pains to distinguish it from both perception and mind. In a
brief discussion dedicated to imagination (De Anima iii 3),
Aristotle identifies it as "that in virtue of which an image
occurs in us" (De Anima iii 3, 428aa1-2), where this is
evidently given a broad range of application, including the
activities involved in thoughts, dreams, and memories. Aristotle is,
however, mainly concerned to distinguish imagination from perception
and mind. He distinguishes it from perception on a host of grounds,
including: (i) imagination produces images when there is no
perception, as in dreams; (ii) imagination is lacking in some lower
animals, even though they have perception, which shows that
imagination and perception are not even co-extensive; and (iii)
perception is, Aristotle claims, always true, whereas imagination can
be false, false even in fantastic ways (De Anima iii 3,
428a5-16). He also denies that imagination can be identified with
mind or belief, or any combination of belief and perception (De
Anima iii 3, 428a16-b10), even though it comes about through
sense perception (De Anima iii 3, 429a1-2; De Insomniis
1, 459a17). The suggestion, then, is that imagination is a faculty in
humans and most other animals which produces, stores, and recalls the
images used in a variety of cognitive activities, including those
which motivate and guide action (De Anima iii 3, 429a4-7,
De Memoria 1, 450a22-25).
Because he tends to treat imagination pictographically (De
Anima iii 3, 429a2-4; cf. De Sensu 1, 437a3-17; 3, 439b6),
Aristotle seems to regard the images used in cognitive processes as
representations best thought of on the model of copies or likenesses
of external objects. This much he holds in common with many other
empirically oriented cognitive psychologists. Typically he will
suggest, in this vein, that thought requires images, both genetically
and concurrently, so that "whenever one contemplates, one
necessarily at the same time contemplates in images" (De
Anima iii 8, 432a8-9, 431a16-17; De Memoria 1,
449b31-450a1). His suggestions in this direction may seem
unfortunate, since for a broad range of thoughts, images, construed
naturally and narrowly as pictorial representations, seem unnecessary
or even plainly irrelevant. (It is hard to fathom, e.g., what image
corresponds to the thought that gerunds make for ungainly
syntax--still less is it clear what grounds could compel one to agree
that some image or other must accompany it). Perhaps, though, his
remarks should be tempered by the recognition that Aristotle accepts
the existence of a thinking god whose activity is exhausted by
thinking, but whose thinking is not plausibly regarded as imagistic
(Metaphysics xii 7,1072b26-30). If that is so, Aristotle could
not accept the thesis that for any episode of thought t,
necessarily t is or is directed upon a pictorial image. Still,
Aristotle clearly expects images, so construed, to play a central or
even indispensable role in human cognition.
Desire
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Supplement to Aristotle's Psychology
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy