Aristotle's Rhetoric
Aristotle's rhetoric has had an enormous influence on the
development of the art of rhetoric. Not only authors writing in the
peripatetic tradition, but also the famous Roman teachers of rhetoric,
such as Cicero and Quintilian, frequently used elements stemming from
the Aristotelian doctrine. Nevertheless, these authors were neither
interested in an authentic interpretation of the Aristotelian works
nor in the philosophical sources and backgrounds of the vocabulary
that Aristotle had introduced into rhetorical theory. Thus, for two
millennia the interpretation of Aristotelian rhetoric has become a
matter of the history of rhetoric, not of philosophy. In the most
influential manuscripts and editions, Aristotle's
Rhetoric was surrounded by rhetorical works and even written
speeches of other Greek and Latin authors, and was seldom interpreted
in the context of the whole Corpus Aristotelicum. It was not until the
last few decades that the philosophically salient features of the
Aristotelian rhetoric were rediscovered: in construing a general
theory of the persuasive, Aristotle applies numerous concepts and
arguments which are also treated in his logical, ethical, and
psychological writings. His theory of rhetorical arguments, for
example, is only one further application of his general doctrine of
the sullogismos, which also forms the basis of dialectic,
logic and his theory of demonstration. Another example is the concept
of emotions: though emotions are one of the most important topics in
the Aristotelian ethics, he nowhere offers such an illuminating
account of single emotions as in the Rhetoric. Finally, it is
the Rhetoric too which informs us about the cognitive
features of language and style.
According to ancient testimonies, Aristotle wrote an early dialogue
on rhetoric entitled ‘Grullos’, in which he put
forward the argument that rhetoric cannot be an art
(technê); and since this is precisely the position of
Plato's Gorgias, the lost dialogue Grullos has
traditionally been regarded as a sign of Aristotle's (alleged)
early Platonism. But the evidence for the position of this dialogue is
too tenuous to support such strong conclusions: it also could have
been a ‘dialectical’ dialogue, which listed the Pros and
Cons of the thesis that rhetoric is an art. We do not know much more
about the so-called ‘Technê Sunagogê’,
a collection of previous theories of rhetoric which is also ascribed
to Aristotle. Cicero seems to use this collection itself, or at least
a secondary source relying on it, as his main historical source when
he gives a short survey of the history of pre-Aristotelian rhetoric in
his Brutus 46-48. Finally, Aristotle once mentions a work
called ‘Theodecteia’ which has also been supposed
to be Aristotelian; but more probably he meant the rhetorical handbook
of his follower Theodectes, who was a former pupil of Isocrates.
What has come down to us are just the three books on rhetoric, which
we know as The Rhetoric, though the ancient catalogue of the
Aristotelian works, reported by Diogenes Laertius, mentions only two
books on rhetoric (perhaps our Rhetoric I & II), and two
further books on style (perhaps our Rhetoric III?). Whereas
most modern authors agree that at least the core of Rhet. I
& II presents a coherent rhetorical theory, the two themes of
Rhet. III are not mentioned in the agenda of Rhet. I
& II. The conceptual link between Rhet. I & II and
Rhet. III is not given until the very last sentence of the
second book. It is quite understandable that the authenticity of this
ad hoc composition has been questioned: we cannot exclude the
possibility that these two parts of the Rhetoric had not been
put together until the first edition of Aristotle's works
completed by Andronicus in the first century. In the Poetics
(1456a33) we find a cross-reference to a work called
‘Rhetoric’ which obviously refers to Rhet. I
& II, but excludes Rhet. III. Regardless of such doubts,
the systematic idea which links the two heterogeneous parts of the
Rhetoric together does not at all seem to be unreasonable : it
is not enough to have a supply of things to say (the so-called
“thought”), the theorist of rhetoric must also inform us
about the right way to say those things (the so-called
“style”).
The chronological fixing of the Rhetoric has turned out to be
a delicate matter. At least the core of Rhet. I & II seems
to be an early work, written during Aristotle's first stay in
Athens (it is unclear, however, which chapters belong to that core;
regularly mentioned are the chapters I.4-15 and II.1-17). It is true
that the Rhetoric gives references to historical events which
fall in the time of Aristotle's exile and his second stay in
Athens, but most of them can be found in the chapters II.23-24, and
besides this, examples could have been updated, which is especially
plausible if we assume that the Rhetoric formed the basis of a
lecture held several times. Most striking are the affinities to the
(also early) Topics; if, as it is widely agreed, the
Topics represents a pre-syllogistic state of Aristotelian
logic, the same is true of the Rhetoric: we actually find no
hints of syllogistic inventory in it.
The structure of Rhet. I & II is determined by two
tripartite divisions. The first division consists in the distinction
of the three means of persuasion: The speech can produce persuasion
either through the character of the speaker, the emotional state of
the listener, or the argument (logos) itself (see below §5). The second tripartite division concerns
the three species of public speech. The speech that takes place in
the assembly is defined as the deliberative species. In this
rhetorical species the speaker either advises the audience to do
something or warns against doing something. Accordingly, the audience
has to judge things that are going to happen in the future, and they
have to decide whether these future events are good or bad for the
polis, whether they will cause advantage or harm. The speech that
takes place before a court is defined as the judicial species. The
speaker either accuses somebody or defends herself or someone
else. Naturally, this kind of speech treats things that happened in
the past. The audience or rather jury has to judge whether a past
event was just or unjust, i.e. whether it was according to the law or
contrary to the law. While the deliberative and judicial species have
their context in a controversial situation in which the listener has
to decide in favor of one of two opposing parties, the third species
does not aim at such a decision: the epideictic speech praises or
blames somebody, it tries to describe things or deeds of the
respective person as honorable or shameful.
The first book of the Rhetoric treats the three species in
succession. Rhet. I.4-8 deals with the deliberative, I.9
with the epideictic, I.10-14 the judicial species. These chapters are
understood as contributing to the argumentative mode of persuasion
or—more precisely—to that part of argumentative persuasion
which is specific to the several species of persuasion. The second
part of the argumentative persuasion which is common to all three
species of rhetorical speech is treated in the chapters II.19-26. The
second means of persuasion, which works by evoking the emotions of the
audience, is described in the chapters II.2-11. Though the following
chapters II.12-17 treat of different types of character these chapters
do not, as is often assumed, develop the third means of persuasion,
which depends on the character of the speaker. The underlying theory
of this means of persuasion is elaborated in a few lines of chapter
II.1. The aforementioned chapters II.12-17 give information about
different types of character and their disposition to emotional
response, which can be useful for those speakers who want to arouse
the emotions of the audience. Why the chapters on the argumentative
means of persuasion are separated by the treatment of emotions and
character (in II.2-17) remains a riddle, especially since the chapter
II.18 tries to give a link between the specific and the common aspects
of argumentative persuasion. Rhetoric III.1-12 discusses
several questions of style (see below §8.1),
Rhetoric III.13-19 is on the several parts of a speech.
Aristotle stresses that rhetoric is closely related to dialectic. He
offers several formulas to describe this affinity between the two
disciplines: first of all, rhetoric is said to be a
“counterpart” (antistrophos) to dialectic
(Rhet. I.1, 1354a1); (ii) it is also called an
“outgrowth” (paraphues ti) of dialectic and the
study of character (Rhet. I.2, 1356a25f.); finally, Aristotle
says that rhetoric is part of dialectic and resembles it
(Rhet. I.2, 1356a30f.). In saying that rhetoric is a
counterpart to dialectic Aristotle obviously alludes to Plato's
Gorgias (464bff.) where rhetoric is ironically defined as a
counterpart to cookery in the soul. Since, in this passage, Plato
uses the word ‘antistrophos’ to designate an
analogy, it is likely that Aristotle wants to express a kind of
analogy too: what dialectic is for the (private or academic) practice
of attacking and maintaining an argument, rhetoric is for the
(public) practice of defending oneself or accusing an opponent.
This analogy between rhetoric and dialectic can be substantiated by
several common features of both disciplines:
- Rhetoric and dialectic are concerned with things that do not
belong to a definite genus or are not the object of a specific
science.
- Rhetoric and dialectic rely on accepted sentences (endoxa).
- Rhetoric and dialectic are not dependent on the principles of
certain sciences.
- Rhetoric and dialectic are concerned with both sides of an
opposition.
- Rhetoric and dialectic rely on the same theory of deduction and
induction.
- Rhetoric and dialectic similarly apply the so-called
topoi.
The analogy to dialectic has important implications for the status
of rhetoric. Plato argued in his Gorgias that rhetoric cannot
be an art (technê), since it is not related to a
definite subject, while real arts are defined by their specific
subjects, as e.g. medicine or shoemaking are defined by their
products, i.e. health and shoes. However, though dialectic has no
definite subject, it is easy to see that it nevertheless rests on a
method, because dialectic has to grasp the reason why some arguments
are valid and others are not. Now, if rhetoric is nothing but the
counterpart to dialectic in the domain of public speech, it must be
grounded on an investigation of what is persuasive and what is not,
and this, in turn, qualifies rhetoric as an art.
Further, it is central for both disciplines that they deal with
arguments from accepted premises. Hence the rhetorician who wants to
persuade by arguments or (rhetorical) proofs can adapt most of the
dialectical equipment. Nevertheless, persuasion which takes place
before a public audience is not only a matter of arguments and
proofs, but also of credibility and emotional attitudes. This is why
there are remarkable differences between the two disciplines
too:
- Dialectic can be applied to every object whatsoever, rhetoric is
useful especially in practical and public matters.
- Dialectic proceeds by questioning and answering, while rhetoric
for the most part proceeds in continuous form.
- Dialectic is concerned with general questions, while rhetoric is
concerned for the most part with particular topics (i.e. things about
which we cannot gain real knowledge).
- Certain uses of dialectic apply qualified endoxa,
i.e. endoxa which are approved by experts, while rhetoric aims
at endoxa which are popular.
- Rhetoric must take into account that its target group has only
restricted intellectual resources, whereas such concerns are totally
absent from dialectic.
- While dialectic tries to test the consistency of a set of
sentences, rhetoric tries to achieve the persuasion of a given
audience.
- Non-argumentative methods are absent from dialectic, while
rhetoric uses non-argumentative means of persuasion.
Aristotle defines the rhetorician as someone who is always able to
see what is persuasive (Topics VI.12,
149b25). Correspondingly, rhetoric is defined as the ability to see
what is possibly persuasive in every given case (Rhet. I.2,
1355b26f.). This is not to say that the rhetorician will be able to
convince under all circumstances. Rather he is in a similar situation
as the physician: the latter has a complete grasp of his art only if
he neglects nothing which might heal his patient, though he is not
able to heal every patient. Similarly, the rhetorician has a
complete grasp of his method, if he discovers the available means of
persuasion, though he is not able to convince everybody.
Aristotelian rhetoric as such is a neutral tool that can be used by
persons of virtuous or depraved character. This capacity can be used
for good or bad purposes, it can cause great benefits as well as
great harms. There is no doubt that Aristotle himself regards his
system of rhetoric as something useful, but the good purposes for
which rhetoric is useful do not define the rhetorical capacity as
such. Thus, Aristotle does not hesitate to concede on the one hand
that his art of rhetoric can be misused. But on the other hand he
tones down the risk of misuse by stressing several factors:
Generally, it is true of all goods, except virtue, that they can be
misused. Secondly, using rhetoric of the Aristotelian style it is
easier to convince of the just and good than of their
opposites. Finally, the risk of misuse is compensated by the benefits
which can be accomplished by rhetoric of the Aristotelian
style.
It could still be objected that rhetoric is only useful for those
who want to outwit their audience and conceal their real aims, since
someone who just wants to communicate the truth could be
straightforward and would not need rhetorical tools. This, however,
is not Aristotle's point of view: Even those who just try to
establish what is just and true need the help of rhetoric when they
are faced with a public audience. Aristotle tells us, that it is
impossible to teach such an audience, even if the speaker had the
most exact knowledge of the subject. Obviously he thinks that the
audience of a public speech consists of ordinary people who are not
able to follow an exact proof based on the principles of a
science. Further, such an audience can easily be distracted by
factors which do not pertain to the subject at all; sometimes they
are receptive to flattery or just try to increase their own
advantage. And this situation even becomes worse if the constitution,
the laws, and the rhetorical habits in a city are bad. Finally, most
of the topics that are usually discussed in public speeches do not
allow of exact knowledge, but leave room for doubt; especially in
such cases it is important that the speaker seems to be a credible
person and that the audience is in a sympathetic mood. For all those
reasons it is a matter of persuasiveness, not of knowledge, to affect
the decisions of juries and assemblies. It is true that some people
manage to be persuasive either at random or by habit, but it is
rhetoric which gives us a method to discover all means of
persuasion on any topic whatsoever.
Aristotle joins Plato in criticizing contemporary manuals of
rhetoric. But how does he manage to distinguish his own project over
and against the criticized manuals? The general idea seems to be
this: Previous theorists of rhetoric gave most of their attention to
methods outside the subject; they taught how to slander, how to
arouse emotions in the audience, or how to distract the attention of
the hearers from the subject. This style of rhetoric promotes a
situation in which juries and assemblies no longer form rational
judgments about the given issues but surrender to the
litigants. Aristotelian rhetoric is different in this respect: it is
centered around the rhetorical kind of proof, the enthymeme (see
below §6), which is called the most
important means of persuasion. Since people are most strongly
convinced when they suppose that something has been proven (Rhet.
I.1, 1355a5f.), there is no need for the orator to confuse or
distract the audience by the use of emotional appeals etc. In
Aristotle's view an orator will be even more successful when he
just picks up the convincing aspects of a given issue, thereby using
commonly held opinions as premises. Since people have a natural
disposition for the true (Rhet. I.1, 1355a15f.) and every man
has some contribution to make to the truth (Eudemian Ethics
I.6, 1216b31) there is no unbridgeable gap between the commonly held
opinions and what is true. This alleged affinity between the true and
the persuasive justifies Aristotle's project of a rhetoric which
essentially relies on the persuasiveness of pertinent argumentation;
and it is just this argumentative character of Aristotelian rhetoric
that explains the close affinity between rhetoric and dialectic (see
above §3).
Of course, Aristotle's rhetoric covers non-argumentative tools
of persuasion as well. He tells the orator how to stimulate emotions
and how to make himself credible (see below
§5);
his art of rhetoric includes considerations about delivery and style
(see below
§8.1)
and the parts of a speech. It is understandable that several
interpreters found an insoluble tension between the argumentative
means of pertinent rhetoric and non-argumentative tools which aims at
what is outside the subject. It does not seem, however, that
Aristotle himself saw a major conflict between these diverse tools of
persuasion. Presumably, for the following reasons: (i) He leaves no
doubt that the subject that is treated in a speech has the highest
priority (e.g. Rhet. III.1, 1403b18-27). Thus, it is not
surprising that there are even passages which regard the
non-argumentative tools as a sort of accidental contribution to the
process of persuasion which essentially proceeds in the manner of
dialectic (cp. Rhet. I.1, 1354a15). (ii) There are, he says
(III.1, 1404a2f.) methods which are not right, but necessary because
of certain deficiencies of the audience. His point seems to be that
the argumentative method becomes less effective, the worse the
condition of the audience is. This again is to say that it is due to
the badness of the audience when his rhetoric includes aspects which
are not in line with the idea of argumentative and pertinent
rhetoric. (iii) In dealing with methods of traditional rhetoric
Aristotle obviously assumes that even methods which have
traditionally been used instead of argumentation can be refined so
that they support the aim of an argumentative style of rhetoric. The
prologue of a speech, for example, was traditionally used for appeals
to the hearer, but it can also be used to set out the issue of the
speech, thus contributing to its clearness. Similarly, the epilogue
has traditionally been used to arouse emotions like pity or anger;
but as soon as the epilogue recalls the conclusions reached, it will
make the speech more understandable.
The
systematical core of Aristotle's Rhetoric is the
doctrine that there are three technical means of persuasion. The
attribute “technical” implies two characteristics: (i)
Technical persuasion must rest on a method, and this, in turn, is to
say that we must know the reason why some things are persuasive and
some are not. Further, methodical persuasion must rest on a complete
analysis of what it means to be persuasive. (ii) Technical means of
persuasion must be provided by the speaker himself, whereas
preexisting facts, such as oaths, witnesses, testimonies, etc. are
non-technical, since they cannot be prepared by the speaker.
A speech consists of three things: the speaker, the subject which is
treated in the speech, and the hearer to whom the speech is addressed
(Rhet. I.3, 1358a37ff.). It seems that this reason why only
three technical means of persuasion are possible: Technical means of
persuasion are either (a) in the character of the speaker, or (b) in
the emotional state of the hearer, or (c) in the argument
(logos) itself.
(a) The persuasion is accomplished by character whenever the speech
is held in such a way as to render the speaker worthy of credence. If
the speaker appears to be credible, the audience will form the second
order judgment that propositions put forward by the credible speaker
are true or acceptable. This is especially important in cases where
there is no exact knowledge but room for doubt. But how does the
speaker manage to appear as a credible person? He must display (i)
practical intelligence (phronêsis), (ii) a virtuous
character, and (iii) good will (Rhet. II.1, 1378a6ff.); for,
if he displayed none of them, the audience would doubt that he is
able to give good advices at all. Again, if he displayed (i) without
(ii) and (iii), the audience could doubt whether the aims of the
speaker are good. Finally, if he displayed (i) and (ii) without
(iii), the audience could still doubt whether the speaker gives the
best suggestion, though he knows what it is. But if he displays all
of them, Aristotle concludes, it cannot rationally be doubted that
his suggestions are credible. It must be stressed that the speaker
must accomplish these effects by what he says; it is not
necessary that he is actually virtuous: on the contrary, a
preexisting good character cannot be part of the technical means of
persuasion.
(b) The success of the persuasive efforts depends on the emotional
dispositions of the audience; for we do not judge in the same way when
we grieve and rejoice or when we are friendly and hostile. Thus, the
orator has to arouse emotions exactly because emotions have the power
to modify our judgments: to a judge who is in a friendly mood, the
person about whom he is going to judge seems not to do wrong or only
in a small way; but to the judge who is in an angry mood, the same
person will seem to do the opposite (cp. Rhet. II.1,
1378a1ff.). Many interpreters writing on the rhetorical emotions were
misled by the role of the emotions in Aristotle's ethics: they
suggested that the orator has to arouse the emotions in order (i) to
motivate the audience or (ii) to make them better persons (since
Aristotle requires that virtuous persons do the right things together
with the right emotions). Thesis (i) is false for the simple reason
that the aim of rhetorical persuasion is a certain judgment
(krisis), not an action or practical decision
(prohairesis). Thesis (ii) is false, because moral education
is not the purpose of rhetoric (see above
§4), nor could it be effected by a public
speech: “Now if speeches were in themselves enough to make men
good, they would justly, as Theognis says, have won very great
rewards, and such rewards should have been provided; but as things are
…. they are not able to encourage the many to nobility and
goodness.” (EN X.9. 1179b4-10)
How is it possible for the orator to bring the audience to a certain
emotion? Aristotle's technique essentially rests on the knowledge of
the definition of every significant emotion. Let, for example, anger
be defined as “desire, accompanied with pain, for conspicuous
revenge for a conspicuous slight that was directed against oneself or
those near to one, when such a slight is undeserved.” (Rhet. II.2
1378a31-33). According to such definitions, someone who believes that
he has suffered a slight from a person, who is not entitled to do so,
etc., will become angry. If we take such a definition for granted, it
is possible to deduce circumstances in which a person will most
probably be angry; for example, we can deduce (i) in what state of
mind people are angry and (ii) against whom they are angry and (iii)
for what sorts of reason. Aristotle deduces these three factors for
several emotions in the chapters II.2-11. With this equipment the
orator will be able, for example, to highlight such characteristics of
a case which are likely to provoke anger in the audience. In
comparison with the tricks of former rhetoricians this method of
arousing emotions has a striking advantage: The orator who wants to
arouse emotions must not even speak outside the subject; it is
sufficient to detect aspects of a given subject which are causally
connected with the intended emotion.
(c) We persuade by the argument itself when we demonstrate or seem to
demonstrate that something is the case. For Aristotle, there are two
species of arguments: inductions and deductions (Posterior
Analytics I.1, 71a5ff.). Induction (epagôgê)
is defined as the proceeding from particulars up to a universal
(Topics I.12, 105a13ff.). A deduction (sullogismos)
is an argument in which, certain things having been supposed,
something different from the suppositions results of necessity through
them (Topics I.1, 100a25ff.) or because of their being true
(Prior Analytics I.2, 24b18-20). The inductive argument in
rhetoric is the example (paradeigma); as opposed to other
inductive arguments it does not proceed from many particular cases to
one universal case, but from one particular to a similar particular if
both particulars fall under the same genus (Rhet. I.2,
1357b25ff.). The deductive argument in rhetoric is the enthymeme (see
below
§6):
but when, certain things being the case, something different results,
beside them because of their being true, either universally
or for the most part, it is called deduction here (in
dialectic) and enthymeme there (in rhetoric).
It is remarkable that Aristotle uses the qualification “either
universally or for the most part”: obviously, he wants to say
that in some cases the conclusion follows universally, i.e. by
necessity, while in other cases it follows only for the most
part. At first glance, this seems to be inconsistent, since a
non-necessary inference is no longer a deduction. However, it has been
disputed whether in arguments from probable premises the formula
“for the most part” qualifies the inference itself (“If
for the most part such and such is the case it follows for the
most part that something different is the case”), or only
the conclusion (“If for the most part such and such is the case
it follows by necessity that for the most part
something different is the case”). If the former interpretation
is true, then Aristotle concedes in the very definition of the
enthymeme that some enthymemes are not deductive. But if the latter
interpretation (which has a parallel in An. post. 87b23-25)
is correct, an enthymeme whose premises and conclusion are for the
most part true would still be a valid deduction.
For Aristotle, an enthymeme is what has the function of a proof or
demonstration in the domain of public speech. Since a demonstration is
a kind of sullogismos, and the enthymeme is said to be a
sullogismos too. The word ‘enthymeme’
(from ‘enthumeisthai - to consider’) had already
been coined by Aristotle's predecessors and originally designated
clever sayings, bon mots and short arguments involving a paradox or
contradiction. The concepts ‘proof’ (apodeixis) and
‘sullogismos’ play a crucial role in Aristotle's
logical-dialectical theory. In applying them to a term of conventional
rhetoric Aristotle appeals to a well known rhetorical technique, but,
at the same time, restricts and codifies the original meaning of
‘enthymeme’: properly understood, what people call
‘enthymeme’ should have the form of a
sullogismos, i.e. a deductive argument.
In general, Aristotle regards deductive arguments as a set of
sentences in which some sentences are premises and one is the
conclusion, and the inference from the premises to the conclusion is
guaranteed by the premises alone. Since enthymemes in the proper
sense are expected to be deductive arguments, the minimal requirement
for the formulation of enthymemes is that they have to display the
premise-conclusion-structure of deductive arguments. This is why
enthymemes have to include a statement as well as a kind of reason for
the given statement. Typically this reason is given in a conditional
‘if’-clause or a causal ‘since’- or
‘for’-clause. Examples of the former , conditional type are:
“If not even the gods know everything, human beings can hardly do
so.” “If the war is the cause of present evils, things
should be set right by making peace.” Examples of the latter,
causal type are: “One should not be educated, for one ought not
be envied (and educated people are usually envied).” “She
has given birth, for she has milk.” Aristotle stresses that the
sentence “There is no man among us who is free” taken for
itself is a maxim, but becomes an enthymeme as soon as it is used
together with a reason such as “for all are slaves of money or of
chance (and no slave of money or chance is free).” Sometimes the
required reason may even be implicit, as e.g. in the sentence “As
a mortal do not cherish immortal anger” the reason why one should
not cherish mortal anger is implicitly given in the phrase
“immortal,” which alludes to the rule that is not
appropriate for mortal beings to have such an attitude.
Aristotle calls the enthymeme the “body of persuasion,”
implying that everything else is only an addition or accident to the
core of the persuasive process. The reason why the enthymeme as the
rhetorical kind of proof or demonstration should be regarded as
central for the rhetorical process of persuasion is that we are most
easily persuaded when we think that something has been
demonstrated. Hence, the basic idea of a rhetorical demonstration
seems to be this: In order to make a target group believe that
q, the orator must first select a sentence p or some
sentences p1 … pn that
are already accepted by the target group, secondly she has to show
that q can be derived from p or
p1 … pn, using p
or p1 … pn as
premises. Given that the target persons form their beliefs in
accordance with rational standards, they will accept q as
soon as they understand that q can be demonstrated on the
basis of their own opinions.
Consequently, the construction of enthymemes is primarily a matter of
deducing from accepted opinions (endoxa). Of course, it is
also possible to use premises which are not commonly accepted by
themselves, but can be derived from commonly accepted opinions; other
premises are only accepted since the speaker is held to be credible;
still other enthymemes are built from signs: see
§6.5.
That a deduction is made from accepted opinions—as opposed to
deductions from first and true sentences or principles—is the
defining feature of dialectical argumentation in the Aristotelian
sense. Thus, the formulation of enthymemes is a matter of dialectic,
and the dialectician has the competence that is needed for the
construction of enthymemes. If enthymemes are a subclass of
dialectical arguments then, it is natural to expect a specific
difference by which one can tell enthymemes apart from all other
kinds of dialectical arguments (traditionally, commentators regarded
logical incompleteness as such a difference; for some objections
against the traditional view see
§6.4).
Nevertheless, this expectation is somehow misled: The enthymeme is
different from other kinds of dialectical arguments, insofar as it is
used in the rhetorical context of public speech (and rhetorical
arguments are called ‘enthymemes’); thus, no further formal
or qualitative differences are needed.
However, in the rhetorical context there are two factors that the
dialectician has to keep in mind if she wants to become a rhetorician
too, and if the dialectical argument is to become a successful
enthymeme. Firstly, the typical subjects of public speech do not - as
the subject of dialectic and theoretical philosophy - belong to the
things that are necessarily the case, but are among those things which
are the goal of practical deliberation and can also be otherwise.
Secondly, as opposed to well trained dialecticians the audience of
public speech is characterized by an intellectual insufficiency; above
all, the member of a jury or assembly are not accustomed to follow a
longer chain of inferences. Therefore enthymemes must not be as
precise as a scientific demonstration and should be shorter than
ordinary dialectical arguments. This, however, is not to say that the
enthymeme is defined by incompleteness and brevity. Rather, it is a
sign of a well executed enthymeme that the content and the number of
its premises are adjusted to the intellectual capacities of the public
audience; but even an enthymeme which failed to incorporate these
qualities would still be enthymeme.
In a well known passage (Rhet. I.2, 1357a7-18; similar:
Rhet. II.22, 1395b24-26) Aristotle says that the enthymeme
often has few or even fewer premises than some other deductions,
(sullogismoi). Since most interpreters refer the word
‘sullogismos’ to the syllogistic theory (see the
entry on Aristotle's logic)
according to which a proper deduction has exactly two premises, those
lines have led to the wide spread understanding that Aristotle defines
the enthymeme as a sullogismos in which one of two premises
has been suppressed, i.e. as an abbreviated, incomplete syllogism. But
certainly the mentioned passages do not attempt to give a definition
of the enthymeme, nor does the word ‘sullogismos’
necessarily refer to deductions with exactly two premises. Properly
understood, both passages are about the selection of appropriate
premises, not about logical incompleteness. The remark that
enthymemes often have few or less premises concludes the discussion of
two possible mistakes the orator could make (Rhet. I.2, 1357a7-10): One
can draw conclusions from things that have previously been deduced or
from things that have not been deduced yet. The latter method is
unpersuasive, for the premises are not accepted nor have they been
introduced. The former method is problematic too: if the orator has to
introduce the needed premises by another deduction, and the premises
of this pre-deduction too, etc., one will end up with a long chain of
deductions. Arguments with several deductive steps are common in
dialectical practice, but one cannot expect the audience of a public
speech to follow such long arguments. This is why Aristotle says that
the enthymeme is and should be from fewer premises.
Supplement on The Brevity of the Enthymeme
Just as there is a difference between real and apparent or fallacious
deductions in dialectic, we have to distinguish between real and
apparent or fallacious enthymemes in rhetoric. The topoi for
real enthymemes are given in chapter II.23, for fallacious enthymemes
in chapter II.24. The fallacious enthymeme pretends to include a valid
deduction, while it actually rests on a fallacious inference.
Further, Aristotle distinguishes between enthymemes taken from
probable (eikos) premises and enthymemes taken from signs
(sêmeia). (Rhet. I.2, 1357a32-33). In a different
context he says that enthymemes are based on probabilities, examples,
tekmêria (i.e. proofs, evidences), and signs
(Rhet. II.25, 1402b12-14). Since the so-called tekmêria
are a subclass of signs and the examples are used to establish general
premises, this is only an extension of the former
classification. (Note that both classifications do not interfere with
the idea that premises have to be accepted opinions: with respect to
the signs the audience must believe that they exist and
accept that they indicate the existence of something else,
and with respect to the probabilities people must accept that
something is likely to happen.)However, it is not clear whether this
is meant to be an exhaustive typology. That most of the rhetorical
arguments are taken from probable premises (“For the most part it
is true that …,” “It is likely that …”), is
due to the typical subjects of public speech, which are rarely
necessary. When using a sign-argument or sign-enthymeme we do not try
to explain a given fact; we just indicate, that something
exists or is the case: “… anything such that when it is
another thing is, or when it has come into being the other has come
into being before or after, is a sign of the other's being or having
come into being.” (Prior Analytics II.27, 70a7ff.). But
there are several types of sign-arguments too; Aristotle offers the
following examples:
| |
Rhetoric I.2 |
Prior Analytics II.27 |
| (i) |
Wise men are just, since Socrates is just. |
Wise men are good, since Pittacus is good. |
| (ii) |
He is ill, since he has fever. |
This man has fever, since he breathes rapidly. |
| (iii) |
She has given birth, since she has milk. |
This woman has a child, since she has milk. |
|
|
She is pregnant, since she is pale. |
Sign-arguments of type (i) and (iii) can always be refuted, even if
the premises are true; that is to say that they do not include a valid
deduction (sullogismos); Aristotle calls them
asullogistos (non-deductive). Sign-arguments of type (ii) can
never be refuted if the premise is true, since, for example, it is not
possible that someone has fever without being ill, or that someone has
milk without having given birth, etc. This latter type of
sign-enthymemes is necessary and is also called
tekmêrion (proof, evidence). Now, if some
sign-enthymemes are valid deductions and some are not, it is tempting
to ask whether Aristotle regarded the non-necessary sign-enthymemes as
apparent or fallacious arguments. However, there seems to be a more
attractive reading: We accept a fallacious argument only if we are
deceived about its logical form. But we could regard, for example, the
inference “She is pregnant, since she is pale.” as a good
and informative argument, even if we know that it does not include a
logically necessary inference. So it seems as if Aristotle didn't
regard all non-necessary sign-arguments as fallacious or deceptive;
but even if this is true, it is difficult for Aristotle to determine
the sense in which non-necessary sign-enthymemes are valid arguments,
since he is bound to the alternative of deduction and induction, and
neither class seems appropriate for non-necessary sign-arguments.
Generally speaking, an Aristotelian topos (‘place’,
‘location’) is an argumentative scheme which enables a
dialectician or rhetorician to construe an argument for a given
conclusion. The use of so-called topoi or ‘loci
communes’ can be traced back to early rhetoricians such as
Protagoras, Gorgias (cp. Cicero, Brutus 46-48) and
Isocrates. But, while in earlier rhetoric a topos was
understood as a complete pattern or formula that can be mentioned at a
certain stage of the speech to produce a certain effect, most of the
Aristotelian topoi are general instructions saying that a
conclusion of a certain form can be derived from premises of a certain
form; and because of this ‘formal’ or
‘semi-formal’ character of Aristotelian topoi, one
topos can be used to construe several different
arguments. —Aristotle's book Topics lists some hundred
topoi for the construction of dialectical arguments. These
lists of topoi form the core of the method by which the
dialectician should be able to formulate deductions on any problem
that could be proposed. Most of the instructions that the
Rhetoric gives for the composition of enthymemes are also
organized as lists of topoi; especially the first book of the
Rhetoric essentially consists of topoi concerning
the subjects of the three species of public speech.
It is striking that the work which is almost exclusively dedicated to
the collection of topoi, the book Topics,
does not even make an attempt to define the concept of
topos. At any rate the Rhetoric gives a sort of
defining characterization: “I call the same thing element and
topos; for an element or a topos is a heading under
which many enthymemes fall” (Rhet. 1403a18-19). By
‘element’ Aristotle does not mean a proper part of the
enthymeme, but a general form under which many concrete enthymemes of
the same type can be subsumed. According to this definition the
topos is a general argumentative form or pattern, and the
concrete arguments are instantiations of the general
topos. That the topos is a general instruction from
which several arguments can be derived, is crucial for Aristotle's
understanding of an artful method of argumentation; for a teacher of
rhetoric who makes his pupils learn ready samples of arguments would
not impart the art itself to them, but only the products of this art,
just as if someone pretending to teach the art of shoe-making only
gave samples of already made shoes to his pupils (see Sophistical
Refutations 183b36ff.).
The word ‘topos’ (place, location) most probably
is derived from an ancient method of memorizing a great number of
items on a list by associating them with successive places, say the
houses along a street one is acquainted with. By recalling the houses
along the street we can also remember the associated items. Full
descriptions of this technique can be found in Cicero, De
Oratore II 86-88, 351--360, Auctor ad Herennium III
16-24, 29-40, and in Quintilian, Institutio XI 2, 11-33). In
Topics 163b28--32 Aristotle seems to allude to this
technique: “For just as in the art of remembering, the mere
mention of the places instantly makes us recall the things, so these
will make us more apt at deductions through looking to these defined
premises in order of enumeration.” Aristotle also alludes to this
technique in On the soul 427b18-20, On Memory
452a12-16, and On Dreams 458b20-22.
But though the name ‘topos’ may be derived from
this mnemotechnical context, Aristotle's use of topoi does
not rely on the technique of places. At least within the system of the
book Topics, every given problem must be analyzed in terms of
some formal criteria: Does the predicate of the sentence in question
ascribe a genus or a definition or peculiar or accidental properties
to the subject? Does the sentence express a sort of opposition, either
contradiction or contrariety etc.? Does the sentence express that
something is more or less the case? Does it maintain identity or
diversity? Are the words used linguistically derived from words that
are part of an accepted premise? Depending such formal criteria of the
analyzed sentence one has to refer to a fitting topos. For
this reason the succession of topoi in the book
Topics is organized in accordance with their salient formal
criteria; and this, again, makes a further mnemotechnique
superfluous. More or less the same is true of the
Rhetoric—except that most of its topoi are
structured by material and not by formal criteria as we shall see in
section 7.4.—Besides all this, there is at least one passage in
which the use of the word ‘topos’ can be explained
without referring to the previously mentioned mnemotechnique: In
Topics VIII.1, 155b4-5 Aristotle says: “we must find the
location (topos) from which to attack,” where the word
‘topos’ is obviously used to mean a starting point
for attacking the theses of the opponents.
A typical Aristotelian topos runs as follows: “Again,
if the accident of a thing has a contrary, see whether it belongs to
the subject to which the accident in question has been declared to
belong: for if the latter belongs, the former could not belong; for it
is impossible that contrary predicates should belong at the same time
to the same thing.” (Topics 113a20-24). As most
topoi it includes (i) a sort of general instruction
(“see, whether …”); further it mentions (ii) an
argumentative scheme—in the given example the scheme ‘if the
accidental predicate p belongs to the subject s,
then the opposed P* cannot belong to s too’.
Finally, the topos refers to (iii) a general rule or
principle (“for it is impossible, …”) which justifies
the given scheme. Other topoi often include the discussion
of (iv) examples; still other topoi suggest (v) how to apply
the given schemes.—Though these are elements that regularly occur
in Aristotelian topoi, there is nothing like a standard form
with which all topoi comply. Often Aristotle is very brief
and leaves it to the reader to add the missing elements.
In a nutshell, the function of a topos can be explained as
follows. First of all one has to select an apt topos for a
given conclusion. The conclusion is either a thesis of our opponent
which we want to refute, or our own assertion we want to establish or
defend. Accordingly, there are two uses of topoi: they can
either prove or disprove a given sentence; some can be used for both
purposes, others for only one of them. Most topoi are
selected by certain formal features of the given conclusion; if, for
example, the conclusion maintains a definition, we have to select our
topos from a list of topoi pertaining to
definitions, etc. When it comes to the so-called ‘material’
topoi of the Rhetoric the appropriate
topos must be selected not by formal criteria, but in
accordance with the content of the conclusion—whether, for
example, something is said to be useful or honorable or just,
etc. Once we have selected a topos which is appropriate for
a given conclusion, the topos can be used to construe a
premise from which the given conclusion can be derived. If for
example the argumentative scheme is ‘If a predicate is generally
true of a genus, then the predicate is also true of any species of
that genus’, we can derive the conclusion ‘the capacity of
nutrition belongs to plants’ using the premise ‘the
capacity of nutrition belongs to all living things’, since
‘living thing’ is the genus of the species
‘plants’. If the construed premise is accepted, either by
the opponent in a dialectical debate or by the audience in public
speech, we can draw the intended conclusion.
It has been disputed whether the topos (or, more precisely,
the ‘if …, then …’ scheme that is included in a
topos) which we use to construe an argument must itself be
regarded as a further premise of the argument. It could be a premise
either, as some say, as the premise of a propositional scheme such as
the modus ponens, or, as others assume, as the conditional premise of
a hypothetical syllogism. Aristotle himself does not favor one of
these interpretations explicitly. But even if he regarded the
topoi as additional premises in a dialectical or rhetorical
argument, it is beyond any doubt that he did not use them as premises
which must explicitly be mentioned or even approved by the opponent or
audience.
Supplement on the Topoi of the Rhetoric
[Not yet available]
According to Aristotle Poetics 21, 1457b9-16 and 20-22 a
metaphor is “the application of an alien name by transference either
from genus to species, or from species to genus, or from species to
species, or by analogy, that is, proportion.” These four types are
exemplified as follows:
| |
Type |
Example |
Explanation |
| (i) |
From genus to species |
There lies my ship |
Lying at anchor is a species of the genus “lying” |
| (ii) |
From species to genus |
Verily ten thousand noble deeds hath Odysseus wrought |
Ten thousand is a species of the genus “large number” |
| (iii) |
From species to species. |
(a) With blade of bronze drew away the life |
(a) “To draw away” is used for “to cleave” |
| |
|
(b) Cleft the water with the vessel of unyielding bronze |
(b) “To cleave” is used for “to draw away.” Both,
to draw away and to cleave, are species of “taking away” |
| (iv) |
From analogy. |
(a) To call the cup “the shield of Dionysus” |
(a) The cup is to Dionysus as the shield to Ares |
| |
|
(b) To call the shield “the cup of Ares” |
(b) The shield is to Ares as the cup to Dionysus |
Most of the examples Aristotle offers for types (i) to (iii) would
not be regarded as metaphors in the modern sense; rather they would
fall under the headings of metonomy or synecdoche. The examples
offered for type (iv) are more like modern metaphors. Aristotle
himself regards the metaphors of group (iv), which are built from
analogy, as the most important type of enthymemes. An analogy is
given if the second term is to the first as the fourth to the
third. Correspondingly, an analogous metaphor use the fourth term for
the second, or the second for the fourth. This principle can be
illustrated by the following Aristotelian examples:
| |
Analogy |
Metaphor |
| (a) |
The cup to Dionysus as shield to Ares. |
To call the cup “the shield of Dionysus” or the
shield “the cup of Ares” is a metaphor. |
| (b) |
The old age to life as the evening to day |
To call the old age “evening of the life”
or the evening “old age of the day” is a metaphor |
| (c) |
Sowing to seed as X to sun rays, while the action
of the sun in scattering his rays is nameless; still this process
bears to the sun the same relation as sowing to the seed. |
To call (a nameless) X “sowing of sun
rays” is a metaphor by analogy |
| (d) |
= (a) |
To call the shield “a cup without wine”
is also a metaphor by analogy. |
Examples (a) and (b) obey to the optional instruction that metaphors
can be qualified by adding the term to which the proper word is
relative (cp. “the shield of Ares,” “the
evening of life”). In example (c) there is no proper
name for the thing which is referred to by the metaphor. In example
(d) the relation of analogy is not, as in the other cases, indicated
by the domain to which an item is referred to, but by a certain
negation (for example “without name”); the negations make
clear that the term is not used in its usual sense.
Metaphors are closely related to similes; but as opposed to the
later tradition, Aristotle does not define the metaphor as a
abbreviated simile, but, the other way around, the simile as
metaphor. The simile differs from the metaphor in the form of
expression: while in the metaphor something is identified or
substituted, the simile compares two things with each other, using
words as “like,” “as” etc. For example, “He
rushed as a lion,” is, according to Aristotle, a simile, but
“The lion rushed,” is a metaphor.
While in the later tradition the use of metaphors has been seen as a
matter of mere decoration, which has to delight the hearer, Aristotle
stresses the cognitive function of metaphors. Metaphors, he says,
bring about learning (Rhet. III.10, 1410b14f.). In order to
understand a metaphor, the hearer has to find something common
between the metaphor and the thing which the metaphor is referred
to. For example, if someone calls the old age “stubble,” we
have to find a common genus to which old age and stubble belong; we
do not grasp the very sense of the metaphor until we find that both,
old age and stubble, have lost their bloom. Thus, a metaphor does not
only refer to a thing, but simultaneously describes the respective
thing in a certain respect. This is why Aristotle says that the
metaphor brings about learning: as soon as we understand why someone
uses the metaphor “stubble” to refer to old age, we have
learned at least one characteristic of old age.
- Accepted opinions: endoxa
- Argument: logos
- Art: technê
- Character: êthos
- Counterpart: antistrophos
- Credible: axiopistos
- Decision (practical): prohairesis
- Deduction: sullogismos
- Emotions: pathê
- Enthymeme: enthumêma
- Example: paradeigma
- For the most part: hôs epi to polu
- Induction (epagôgê)
- Judgement: krisis
- Location: topos (an argumentative scheme)
- Maxim: gnômê
- Means of persuasion: pistis (in pre-Aristotelian use this
word also designates a certain part of the speech)
- Metaphor: metaphora
- Persuasive: pithanon
- Place: topos (an argumentative scheme)
- Practical intelligence: phronêsis
- Premise: protasis (can also mean 'sentence', statement')
- Probable: eikos
- Proof: apodeixis (in the sense of ‘demonstrative
argument, demonstration’)
- Proof: tekmêrion (i.e. a necessary sign or sign
argument)
- Sign: sêmeion (can also mean ‘sign argument’)
- Style: lexis
- Specific topoi: idioi topoi (Aristotle
refers to them also by ‘idiai protaseis’ or
‘eidê’)
- Barnes, Jonathan. 1981. “Proof and the Syllogism.” In E. Berti
(ed.), Aristotle on Science: The Posterior Analytics. Padua:
Antenore. 17-59.
- Bitzer, L. F. 1959. “Aristotle's Enthymeme Revisited.” In
Quarterly Journal of Speech 45: 399-408.
- Burnyeat, Myles. 1994. “Enthymeme: The Logic of Persuasion.” In
D. J. Furley and A. Nehamas (eds.), Aristotle's
Rhetoric. Princeton: Princeton University Press. 3-55.
- Cooper, John M. 1993. “Rhetoric, Dialectic, and the Passions.” In
Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 11: 175-198.
- Cope, Edward Meredith. 1867 [1970]. An Introduction to
Aristotle's Rhetoric. Cambridge 1867. Repr. Hildesheim:
Olms.
- -----. 1877 [1970]. The Rhetoric of Aristotle, with a
Commentary. Revised and edited by John Edwin Sandys. 3
vols. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Repr. Hildesheim:
Olms.
- Cronkhite, Garry L. 1966. “The Enthymeme as Deductive Rhetorical
Argument.” In Western Speech Journal 30: 129-134.
- Dufour, Médéric and Wartelle,
André. 1960-73. Aristote, Rhétorique. Texte
établi et traduit. 3 vols. Paris: Les Belles Lettres.
- Erickson, Keith V. (ed.). 1974. Aristotle: The Classical
Heritage of Rhetoric, Metuchen, N.J.
- Fortenbaugh, William W. 1970. “Aristotle's Rhetoric
on Emotions.” In Archiv fuer Geschichte der Philosophie 52:
40-70.
- ----- and Mirhady, David C. (eds.). 1994. Peripatetic Rhetoric
after Aristotle. Rutgers University Studies in Classical
Humanities 6, New Brunswick/London: Transaction Publishers.
- Freese, John Henry. 1926. Aristotle, The ‘Art’ of
Rhetoric. London and Cambridge, Mass.: Loeb Classical
Library. Harvard University Press.
- Furley, David J. and Nehamas, Alexander
(eds.). 1994. Aristotle's Rhetoric. Princeton: Princeton
University Press.
- Garver, Eugene. 1994. Aristotle's Rhetoric. An Art of
Character, Chicago/London: The University of Chicago Press .
- Grimaldi, William M. A. 1957. “A Note on the PISTEIS in
Aristotle's Rhetoric 1354-1356.” In American Journal of
Philology 78: 188-192.
- -----. 1980/1988. Aristotle, Rhetoric I-II. A
Commentary. New York: Fordham University Press.
- Halliwell, Stephen. 1993. “Style and Sense in Aristotle's
Rhetoric Book 3.” In Revue Internationale de
Philosophie 47: 50-69.
- Kassel, Rudolf. 1976. Aristotelis Ars Rhetorica. Berlin
and New York: De Gruyter.
- Kennedy, George A. 1991. Aristotle, On Rhetoric. A Theory of
Civic Discourse, Newly Translated, with Introduction, Notes and
Appendices, New York/Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Leighton, Stephen. 1982. “Aristotle and the Emotions.” In
Phronesis 27: 144-174.
- Madden, Edward H. 1952. “The Enthymeme. Crossroads of Logic,
Rhetoric and Metaphysics.” In Philosophical Review 61:
368-376.
- McBurney, James H. 1936. “The Place of the Enthymeme in
Rhetorical Theory.” In Speech Monographs 3: 49-74.
- Miller, Arthur B./Bee, John D. 1972. “Enthymemes: Body and Soul.”
In Philosophy and Rhetoric 5: 201-214.
- Natali, Carlo 1990. “Due modi di trattare le opinioni
notevole. La nozione di felicità in Aristotele,
Retorica I 5.” In Methexis 3: 51-63.
- Primavesi, Oliver. 1996. Die aristotelische
Topik. Munich: C. H. Beck.
- Raphael, Sally. 1974. “Rhetoric, Dialectic and
Syllogistic Argument: Aristotle's Position in Rhetoric I-II.” In
Phronesis 19: 153-167.
- Rapp, Christof. 1996. “Aristoteles ueber die Rationalitaet
rhetorischer Argumente.” In Zeitschrift für philosophische
Forschung 50: 197-222.
- -----. 2002. Aristoteles, Rhetorik. Translation,
Introduction, and Commentary, 2 Vol. Berlin: Akademie Verlag.
- Roberts, W. Rhys. 1924 [1984]. Rhetorica. In W. D. Ross
(ed.), The Works of Aristotle Translated into English, Oxford:
Clarendon Press. Repr. in Jonathan Barnes (ed.), The Works of
Aristotle. Princeton: Princeton University Press. II
2152-2269.
- Ryan, Eugene E. 1984. Aristotle's Theory of Rhetorical
Argumentation, Montreal: Les Éditions Bellarmin.
- Seaton, R. C. 1914. “The Aristotelian Enthymeme.” In
Classical Review 28: 113-119.
- Rorty, Amelie O. (ed.). 1996. Essays on Aristotle's
Rhetoric. Berkeley/Los Angeles/London: University of California
Press.
- Ross, W. D. (ed.). 1959. Aristotelis ars rhetorica.
Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Solmsen, Friedrich. 1929. Die Entwicklung der aristotelischen
Logik und Rhetorik. Berlin: Weidmann.
- -----. 1938. “Aristotle and Cicero on the Orator's Playing
upon the Feelings.” In Classical Philology 33: 390-404.
- Sprute, Juergen. 1982. Die Enthymemtheorie der
aristotelischen Rhetorik. Goettingen: Vandenhoeck & Ruprecht
.
- Thompson, W. H.. 1972. “Stasis in Aristotle's
Rhetoric.” In Quarterly Journal of Speech 58: 134-141
.
- Weidemann, Hermann. 1989. “Aristotle on Inferences from Signs
(Rhetoric I 2, 1357b1-25).” In Phronesis 34:
343-351.
- Woerner, Markus. 1990. Das Ethische in der Rhetorik des
Aristoteles. Freiburg/Munich: Alber.
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Aristotle |
Cicero
Copyright © 2002
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy