This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge
Proof.
() By Lemma 2.12,
(
)
is common knowledge at
, so E is common knowledge at
by Proposition 2.4.
() We must show that K *N ( E ) implies that
(
)
E.
Suppose that there exists
(
)
such that
E.
Since
(
),
is reachable from
,
so there exists a sequence 0, 1, . . . , m - 1 with associated states
1,
2, . . . ,
m and information sets
i k(
k ) such that
0 =
,
m =
, and
k
i k(
k + 1). But at information set
i k(
m ), agent i k does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i 1 cannot rule out the possibility that agent i 2 thinks that . . . that agent i m - 1 thinks that agent i m does not know E.
Peter Vanderschraaf peterv@MAIL1.ANDREW.CMU.EDU |