Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.8

Proof.
Suppose that L*_N ( E ). By definition, there is a basis proposition A* such that A*. It suffices to show that for each m 1 and for all agents i ₁, i ₂, . . . , i _m N,

K i 1K i 2 . . . K i m( E )

We prove the result by induction on m. The m = 1 case follows at once from ( L1 ) and ( L3 ). Now if we assume that for m = k, L*_N ( E ) implies K _{i 1}K _{i 2} . . . K _{i k}( E ), then L*_N ( E ) K _{i 1}K _{i 2} . . . K _{i k}( E ) because is an arbitrary possible world, so K _{i 1}( A* ) K _{i 1}K _{i 2} . . . K _{i k}( E ) by ( L3 ). Since ( L2 ) is the case and the agents of N are A*-symmetric reasoners,

K i 1( A* ) K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E )

for any i _k+1 N, so K _{i 1}K _{i 2} . . . K _{i k}( E ) by ( L1 ), which completes the induction since i ₁, i _k+1, i ₂, . . . , i _k are k + 1 arbitrary agents of N.

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