Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 3.1

( i ) Agents i and j have a common prior probability distribution () over the events of such that ( ) > 0 for each , and

( ii ) It is common knowledge at that i's posterior probability of event E is q _i( E ) and that j's posterior probability of E is q _j( E ).

Proof.
Let be the meet of all the agents' partitions, and let ( ) be the element of containing . Since ( ) consists of cells common to every agents information partition, we can write

( ) =

k

H ik,

where each H _{ik i}. Since i's posterior probability of event E is common knowledge, it is constant on ( ), and so

q i( E ) = ( E | H ik ) for all k

Hence,

( E H ik ) = q i( E ) ( H ik )

and so

( E ( ) )	=	( E k H ik )	=	( k E H ik )
	=	k ( E H ik )	=	k q i( E ) ( H ik )
	=	q i ( E ) k ( H ik )	=	q i( E ) ( k H ik )
	=	q i( E ) ( ( ) )

Applying the same argument to j, we have

( E ( ) ) = q j( E ) ( ( ) )

so we must have q _i( E ) = q _j( E ).

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