A Quantitative Version of a Draper-Style Argument: A Supplement to The Problem of Evil (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Spring 2003 Edition)

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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to The Problem of Evil

A Quantitative Version of a Draper-Style Argument

(1) Pr(O/HI) > Pr(O/T) + k (Substantive premise)

(2) Pr(O/HI) = Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) (Definition of conditional probability)

Therefore

(3) Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O/T) + k (From (1) and (2).)

(4) Pr(O/T) = Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) (Definition of conditional probability)

Therefore

(5) Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) + k (From (3) and (4).)

(6) Pr(O & HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O) (From the definition of conditional probability)

Therefore

(7) Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI) (From (6).)

Therefore

(8) Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) + k (From (5) and (7).)

(9) Pr(O & T) = Pr(T/O) × Pr(O) (From the definition of conditional probability)

Therefore

(10) Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) = Pr(T/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(T) (From (9).)

Therefore

(11) Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(T) + k (From (8) and (10).)

(12) Pr(O/HI) > 0 (From (1).)

(13) Pr(HI) > 0, (Substantive premise)

(14) Pr(OI/HI) × Pr(HI) = Pr(O & HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O) (From the definition of conditional probability)

Therefore

(15) Pr(O) > 0, (From (12), (13), and (14).)

so that Pr(HI)/Pr(O) is defined. Therefore, we can multiply both sides of (11) by Pr(HI)/Pr(O) which gives:

(16) Pr(HI/O) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(HI)/Pr(T) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O)

(17) HI entails ~T (Substantive premise)

Therefore

(18) Pr(~T/O) Pr(HI/O) (From (17).)

Therefore

(19) Pr(~T/O) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(HI)/Pr(T) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O) (From (16) and (18).)

(20) Pr(HI) Pr(T) (Substantive premise)

Therefore

(21) Pr(~T/O) > Pr(T/O) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O) (From (19) and (20).)

(22) O entails [(T & O) or (~T & O)] and [(T & O) or (~T & O)] entails O (Logical truth)

Therefore

(23) Pr(T & O) + Pr(~T & O) = Pr(O) (From (22).)

Then, in view of (15), we can divide both sides of (23) by Pr(O), which gives us:

(24) Pr(T & O)/Pr(O) + Pr(~T & O)/Pr(O) = Pr(O)/Pr(O) = 1
Therefore

(25) Pr(T/O) + Pr(~T/O) = 1 (From (24).)

Therefore

(26) Pr(T) < 0.5 - k × Pr(HI)/2 ×Pr(O) (From (21) and (25).)

Return to The Problem of Evil

Michael Tooley
Michael.Tooley@Colorado.edu

(1)	Pr(O/HI) > Pr(O/T) + k	(Substantive premise)
(2)	Pr(O/HI) = Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI)	(Definition of conditional probability)
	Therefore
(3)	Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O/T) + k	(From (1) and (2).)
(4)	Pr(O/T) = Pr(O & T)/Pr(T)	(Definition of conditional probability)
	Therefore
(5)	Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) + k	(From (3) and (4).)
(6)	Pr(O & HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)	(From the definition of conditional probability)
	Therefore
(7)	Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI)	(From (6).)
	Therefore
(8)	Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI) > Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) + k	(From (5) and (7).)
(9)	Pr(O & T) = Pr(T/O) × Pr(O)	(From the definition of conditional probability)
	Therefore
(10)	Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) = Pr(T/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(T)	(From (9).)
	Therefore
(11)	Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(HI) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(O)/Pr(T) + k	(From (8) and (10).)

(13)	Pr(HI) > 0,	(Substantive premise)
(14)	Pr(OI/HI) × Pr(HI) = Pr(O & HI) = Pr(HI/O) × Pr(O)	(From the definition of conditional probability)
	Therefore
(15)	Pr(O) > 0,	(From (12), (13), and (14).)

(16)	Pr(HI/O) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(HI)/Pr(T) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O)
(17)	HI entails ~T	(Substantive premise)
	Therefore
(18)	Pr(~T/O) Pr(HI/O)	(From (17).)
	Therefore
(19)	Pr(~T/O) > Pr(T/O) × Pr(HI)/Pr(T) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O)	(From (16) and (18).)
(20)	Pr(HI) Pr(T)	(Substantive premise)
	Therefore
(21)	Pr(~T/O) > Pr(T/O) + k × Pr(HI)/Pr(O)	(From (19) and (20).)
(22)	O entails [(T & O) or (~T & O)] and [(T & O) or (~T & O)] entails O	(Logical truth)
	Therefore
(23)	Pr(T & O) + Pr(~T & O) = Pr(O)	(From (22).)

(24)	Pr(T & O)/Pr(O) + Pr(~T & O)/Pr(O) = Pr(O)/Pr(O) = 1
	Therefore
(25)	Pr(T/O) + Pr(~T/O) = 1	(From (24).)
	Therefore
(26)	Pr(T) < 0.5 - k × Pr(HI)/2 ×Pr(O)	(From (21) and (25).)

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy Supplement to The Problem of Evil

A Quantitative Version of a Draper-Style Argument

Supplement to The Problem of Evil Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to The Problem of Evil

Supplement to The Problem of Evil
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy