Francis of Marchia

• Life and Work
• Philosophical Theology
• Natural Philosophy
• Political and Social Thought
• Critical Editions of Texts
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Life and Work

Until 1991 almost none of Marchia's writings were published and only Anneliese Maier devoted serious and sustained attention to his thought. Since then, however, Nazareno Mariani has published three volumes of Marchia's works (Marchia 1993, 1998, and 1997b): the Improbatio, the Physics commentary, and the Quodlibet, the last of which includes roughly a quarter of the main version — the Scriptum — of book I of the Sentences commentary, and two questions from book II, in appendices. In a 1991 monograph on Marchia's cosmological thought (Schneider 1991, 29), Notker Schneider announced the edition of the Metaphysics commentary, building on the work of Albert Zimmermann (Marchia 1965, Zimmermann 1966). Schneider, Russell Friedman, and Christopher Schabel have added to Mariani's efforts in editing sections of the Sentences commentary (Marchia 1991b, 1997a, 1999a, 1999b, 2000, 2001). Currently, Mariani is editing the Reportatio for book I, while Friedman and Schabel are occupied with the Scriptum on the same book. The Centro Studi Francesco d'Appignano was established in Marchia's hometown in May of 2001 during the First International Conference on Francis of Marchia. The second such conference is planned for 2003. Finally, the journal Picenum Seraphicum, edited by Roberto Lambertini, promises to be a forum for Marchia studies.

Philosophical Theology

A critical edition of one redaction of Marchia's Sentences commentary would probably take up about five large volumes. It is roughly equal in size to that of his contemporary and confrère Landulph Caracciolo. Whereas Caracciolo's commentary is frequently a disjointed, point-by-point refutation of Peter Auriol and defense of Scotus on many issues, however, Marchia was more selective in choosing his topics, more independent in giving his determination, and generally more eloquent. For example, Marchia asks only one brief question on the Immaculate Conception, a favorite Franciscan topic (book III, q. 8, and because of a missing quire this question is not present in the most studied manuscript, Vat. Chigi. lat. B VII 113), showing himself to support the immaculatist position, but he asks a great number of questions in books I, II, and IV on the relationship between the will and intellect.

Thus, although Auriol's controversial opinions on epistemology and divine foreknowledge drew fire from Caracciolo and most other Paris theologians up to Gregory of Rimini's day, even from Oxford Franciscans, Marchia devoted much energy to foreknowledge but almost ignored the great debate over intuitive and abstractive cognition. Aside from an isolated mention of "intuitive cognition" in Scriptum I, d. 3, q. 4, and of "intuitive vision" in the very last question in book IV, Marchia merely discusses the problem in passing on two brief occasions: first, in book II, q. 25 (Marchia 1997b, p. 322), while treating angelic knowledge, and second, in book III, q. 13, in the context of the beatific vision of the Word (not yet edited). In the latter case, the more substantial passage, he gives a somewhat Scotistic definition: "Intuitive and abstractive cognition are not distinguished according to having a species or not, but only according to the disposition of the object, because if the object is present, the species represents it intuitively; if absent, it represents it abstractively." Therefore, "the same species that is intuitive in the presence of the object is abstractive in the absence of the object." Marchia adds in agreement with Auriol that God "can cause the act of seeing without the object," and that a species of a created object "indifferently represents" a present or absent object. Although this might provoke some epistemological questions, Marchia turns to the vision of the Essence and leaves human cognition in via aside.

In contrast, Marchia singled out divine foreknowledge for special treatment, devoting three entire distinctions (Scriptum I, dd. 35, 36, and 38) to the issue and concentrating most of his discussion on the reconcilation of foreknowledge with human free will (Marchia 1999b, 2000; Schabel 2000). Here Marchia was opposed in some way to just about everyone else who had written on the issue, but mainly Auriol, who had claimed that any determination prior to the coming about of a contingent event destroyed contingency, including the truth or falsity of future-contingent propositions. Marchia's defense of the application of the Principle of Bivalence to propositions about the contingent future was the model for Gregory of Rimini. But having shown that such propositions are either determinately true or false, Marchia went on to articulate a type of prior determination that saved foreknowledge while preserving contingency. In fact, according to Marchia, there must be some determination in the causes of future contingent events prior to their actual occurrence, otherwise nothing would occur:

And I ask about that determination in the cause, was it in the cause before the placing of the effect [into reality] or not? If it was, then I have my point. If not, I ask, how is the effect determined in its cause before it is put into being, necessarily or contingently? If necessarily, then it comes about necessarily, according to this opinion. If contingently and a contingent is not determined to one side in its cause, then that determination is not determined except through some prior contingent determination. And I would ask of this just as before, will it go on infinitely, or is it necessary to stop at some contingent determination in the cause before the effect? (d. 35: Marchia 1999, p. 75)

An obvious objection is that, for Marchia, the effect is determinate in the cause before the action of the cause, and thus that determination is ‘presupposed’ in the subsequent action of the cause. Since it is ‘presupposed’, that determination is not in the cause's power, and thus is not contingent. Marchia replies with another distinction:

‘Action’ can be taken in three ways: either it can be taken actually, namely when an agent is actually acting; or it can be taken virtually, when an agent can act although he is not acting; or it can be taken in a middle way, not purely actually nor purely virtually, but in a middle way as ‘dispositionally’ or ‘aptitudinally’, namely when an agent is not acting but is determined toward acting, although in actuality he is not acting — and he not only can act, but is determined to be acting later. Similarly there is a threefold ‘determination’ of the agent: one actual, by which an agent actually determinately puts one part of a contradiction into effect; a second is a potential determination by which an agent posits or can determine any part of a contradiction dividedly; the other is, as it were, a ‘dispositional’ or ‘aptitudinal’ determination, by which an agent is determined with respect to the future to putting one part of a contradiction [into effect]. Each determination presupposes the action corresponding to it, because an actual determination follows the action in actuality; the dispositional determination follows the action dispositionally, although it precedes the actual action; the potential determination follows the potential action, although it precedes that actual and dispositional action. (d. 35: Marchia 1999, pp. 89–90)

The foregoing example is representative of Marchia's thought in many ways. He frequently draws clever and original distinctions, and the de possibili/ de inesse division is employed in other contexts such as predestination (book I, d. 40: Marchia 2001). He makes similar innovative distinctions when discussing the different types of human and divine willing (Reportatio I, dd. 45-48: see attached edition). Although one could argue about the cogency of Marchia's arguments, in the case of the de possibili/ de inesse distinction Marchia found a favorable response among the following, who adopted the device: his Franciscan successors at Paris in the next decade Aufredo Gonteri Brito, William Rubio, and William of Brienne; the Augustinian Hermits Michael of Massa and Gregory of Rimini; and, in the later fifteenth century, Fernando of Cordoba and Francesco della Rovere, who was to become Pope Sixtus IV. Thus in philosophical theology one could and often did look to Marchia for an alternative to Scotus and an innovative response to Auriol.

Natural Philosophy

One of the most important innovations of the mature Galileo was the assertion that the celestial and terrestial realms are made of the same fundamental matter and therefore follow the same basic natural laws. Francis of Marchia put forth a similar hypothesis in his commentary on book II, qq. 29-32 (Marchia 1991b). Contrary to contemporary Aristotelian theory, Marchia argues that the heavens are not made up of a fifth, incorruptible, nobler element, which radically differentiates the supralunar realm from the sublunar one. On the contrary, the basic matter is the same everywhere, and just as Marchia considers the natural world to follow predictable patterns, he also thinks that those patterns are universally applicable. These two tenets have important implications for the practice of natural philosophy (Schneider 1991).

With this attitude it is no wonder Marchia's physical theories drew the attention of medieval and modern scholars alike. The first important study on Marchia's thought was Anneliese Maier's partial edition and analysis of book IV, q. 1, of Marchia's Sentences commentary (Marchia 1940). There Marchia puts forth his famous forerunner to John Buridan's impetus theory of projectile motion. Aristotle had not provided a satisfactory explanation for why, when we throw a ball, for example, the ball keeps going even after we have released it. Marchia's explanation, which had its own partial predecessors, was that we leave behind a force in the ball — a virtus derelicta — that keeps the ball in motion. The fact that this force was temporary rather than permanent meant that it was not akin to the inertia theory of classical mechanics, but, as Marchia stated explicitly, it was a simple theory and did explain the phenomena in temporary projectile motion. Marchia also applied the theory to celestial motion, but he does not appear to have reconciled the semi-permanent nature of the motion of the heavens with the more ephemeral virtus derelicta. Maier saw reactions to Marchia's treatment in the works of Francis of Meyronnes, his follower Himbert of Garda, Nicholas Bonet, John Canonicus, William of Ockham, and Buridan, although it is hard to say whether he had much positive influence in this context.

Perhaps medieval scholars did not arrive at inertia because of their reluctance to consider motion in a vacuum. In observable projectile motion, at least in the fourteenth century, the projectile always ended up back on the ground. One of Aristotle's arguments for the impossibility of a vacuum was the lack of resistance of the medium. If velocity was a function of the proportion of force to the resistance of the medium, then with no resistance there would be motion in an instant, something usually considered an impossibility. In book II, q. 16, a. 5 of his Sentences commentary, however, Marchia has to wonder why an angel, which is not a "corpus quantum," or bodily mass, cannot move instantaneously, i.e. from one place to another without any temporal duration. Part of the answer is simply that it is a contradiction to be two places at once, but Marchia adds that there must be some sort of internal resistance in angels that makes instantaneous motion impossible. The notion of internal resistance unrelated to natural place (even though no corpus quantum is involved) and the concept of impetus (Buridan's making the virtus derelicta permanent) appear to be primitive versions of the ingredients of a theory of inertial mass. Since Marchia's writings predate those of his more famous successors, the Oxford Calculators and Buridan and Nicole Oresme at Paris, and some of his ideas at least resemble Galileo's in some way, Marchia's possible impact on later scientists is a good topic for future research.

Political and Social Thought

The Franciscans maintained that they lived the most perfect life that was humanly possible, following the model of Christ and the apostles who, they claimed, possessed nothing either as individuals or in common. John XXII not only denied that Christ and the apostles had no possessions, but he also declared the Franciscan position to be heretical. The resulting quarrel came to touch on such issues as usury, ownership of property, disposal of property, natural and divine law and rights, papal infallibility, and ultimately the basis of sovereignty.

On the question on dominion, or possession, of property, Marchia accepted the pope's assertion that, even in the state of nature before the fall, Adam had dominion over the things he used, but Marchia denied that this type of dominion had much at all in common with post-lapsarian dominion: they are alterius generis, differing like violent and natural, like corruptible and incorruptible (Lambertini 2000, VII). Before the fall, Adam had "dominion of natural liberty and perfection," according to the "primaeval natural law"; afterwards, although Marchia admitted that there was a "remnant of natural law," basically it had to be replaced by positive law and the dominion of "servile necessity" and the "power of compulsion." This is because, if left to his own devices, post-lapsarian man would grab all he could get.

Marchia describes the situation in the state of nature thus:

In the state of nature all things had been common to all people, not only with respect to the dominion of things but also with respect to use, whether de iure or de facto — with respect to use de iure because the right of using whatever was suitable to them had been common to all and proper to none. (Marchia 1993, pp. 154-5)

The upshot is that private property is not divinely instituted, for Marchia: it is a human introduction. In the state of nature, by divine law, humans had a common "dominion" over goods, but this dominion is not at all the dominion of human law, of private property. Moreover, it is this common dominion that Christ and the apostles followed. It is therefore humanly possible to do so, indeed the best possible way to live, and the Franciscans approached it more closely than anyone else.

On the question of ecclesiastical power, of course, Marchia was also in disagreement with Pope John XXII (Lambertini 2000, IX). In order to defend Christ's poverty and that of the Franciscans by extension, Marchia interpreted Christ's remark to Pilate that "my kingdom is not of this world" as meaning not only that the origins of his kingdom and the source of his power are not of this world, but also that his kingdom and his power are not with respect to the things of this world. Indeed, for Marchia, Caesar had legitimate sovereignty over this world. Marchia thus denied that Christ, as a man, possessed any temporal power, and hence he rejected John XXII's claim that Christ was rex and dominus in a temporal sense. The implication is that the pope could not inherit temporal power over the entire earth, although Marchia admitted that the temporal sword could pertain to the pope indirectly and mediately.

Given that the few studies that have been done demonstrate that Marchia had an impact on his successors in many areas of philosophical thought, and given that it is only in the past decade that any substantial part of his works has been available in print, we can in the near future expect a flood of investigations of the ideas of this interesting and important scholastic thinker.

Critical Editions of Texts

• Francis of Marchia, Reportatio in primum librum Sententiarum, Distinctio 39, 42-44, 45-48
• Francis of Marchia, In secundum librum Sententiarum, Quaestio 16, Articulus 5

Bibliography

Texts

• Marchia 1940: IV Sent., q. 1: ed. A. Maier, “Franciscus de Marchia,” A. Maier, Die Impetustheorie (Vienna-Leipzig 1940), 45–77; reprinted A. Maier, Zwei Grundprobleme der scholastischen Naturphilosophie (= Storia e Letteratura, 37) (Rome 1968), 161–200; English trans. of text in M. Clagett, The Science of Mechanics in the Middle Ages (Madison 1959), 526–30.
• Marchia 1965: Metaphysics I, q. 1, and VI, q. 16: ed. A. Zimmermann, Ontologie oder Metaphysik? Die Diskussion über den Gegenstand der Metaphysik im 13. und 14. Jahrhundert. Texte und Untersuchungen (= Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, 8) (Leiden 1965).
• Marchia 1986: Metaphysics II, q. 5: ed. N. Schneider, “Eine ungedruckte Quaestio zur Erkennbarkeit des Unendlichen in einem Metaphysik-Kommentar des 14. Jahrhunderts,” in A. Zimmermann, ed., Miscellanea Mediaevalia 18 (Berlin 1986), 96–118.
• Marchia 1991a: Metaphysics III, q. 9, in Schneider 1991.
• Marchia 1991b: II Sent., qq. 29–32, in Schneider 1991.
• Marchia 1993: Francisci de Esculo, OFM, Improbatio contra libellum Domini Johannis qui incipit Quia vir reprobus, ed. N. Mariani (= Spicilegium Bonaventurianum, 28) (Grottaferrata 1993).
• Marchia 1997a: Scriptum I, d. 27: ed. R.L. Friedman “In principio erat Verbum: The Incorporation of Philosophical Psychology into Trinitarian Theology, 1250–1325” (PhD Dissertation, University of Iowa 1997), 555–72.
• Marchia 1997b: Francisci de Marchia sive de Esculo, OFM, Quodlibet cum quaestionibus selectis ex commentario in librum Sententiarum, ed. N. Mariani (= Spicilegium Bonaventurianum, 29) (Grottaferrata 1997).
• Marchia 1998: Francisci de Marchia sive de Esculo, OFM, Sententia et compilatio super libros Physicorum Aristotelis, ed. N. Mariani (= Spicilegium Bonaventurianum, 30) (Grottaferrata 1998).
• Marchia 1999a: Scriptum I, d. 11: ed. R.L. Friedman, “Francis of Marchia and John Duns Scotus on the Psychological Model of the Trinity,” Picenum Seraphicum 18 n.s. (1999), 11–56.
• Marchia 1999b: Scriptum I, d. 35: ed. C. Schabel, “Il determinismo di Francesco di Marchia (Parte I),” Picenum Seraphicum 18 n.s. (1999), 57–95.
• Marchia 2000: Scriptum I, dd. 36, and 38: ed. C. Schabel, “Il determinismo di Francesco di Marchia (Parte II),” Picenum Seraphicum 19 n.s. (2000), 3–55.
• Marchia 2001: Scriptum I, dd. 39–40: ed. C. Schabel, “La dottrina sulla predestinazione di Francesco di Marchia,” Picenum Seraphicum 20 n.s. (2001), forthcoming.

Secondary Literature

• Bakker, P.J.J.M. 1999: La raison et miracle. Les doctrines Eucharistiques (c. 1250 – c. 1400), 2 vols. (Nijmegen 1999).
• Duhem, P. 1985: Medieval Cosmology. Theories of Infinity, Place, Time, Void, and the Plurality of Worlds, trans. R. Ariew (Chicago 1985).
• Friedman, R.L., and C. Schabel 2001: “Francis of Marchia's Commentaries on the Sentences: Question List and State of Research,” Mediaeval Studies 63 (2001), forthcoming.
• Kürzinger, J. 1930: Alfonsus Vargas Toletanus und seine theologische Einleitungslehre. Ein Beitrag zur Geschichte der Scholastik im 14. Jahrhundert (= BGPTM 22.5-6) (Münster i. W. 1930).
• Lambertini, R. 2000: La povertà pensata. Evoluzione storica della definizione dell'identità minoritica da Bonaventura ad Ockham (Modena 2000), papers VII, VIII, and IX.
• Lambertini, R., forthcoming: “Francesco d'Ascoli e la polemica francescana contro Giovanni XXII: A proposito dei rapporti tra l'Improbatio e l'Appellatio magna monacensis.”
• Lang, A. 1930: Die Wege der Glaubensbedrüngen bei den Scholastikern des 14. Jahrhunderts (= BGPTM 30.1-2) (Münster i. W. 1930).
• Maier, A. 1949: Die Vorläufer Galileis im 14. Jahrhundert (= Storia e Letteratura, 22) (Rome 1949).
• Maier, A. 1950: An der Grenze von Scholastik und Naturwissenschaft (= Storia e Letteratura, 41) (Rome 1952).
• Maier, A. 1955: Metaphysische Hintergründe der spätscholastischen Naturphilosophie (= Storia e Letteratura, 52) (Rome 1955).
• Maier, A. 1958: Zwischen Philosophie und Mechanik (= Storia e Letteratura, 69) (Rome 1958).
• Miethke, J. 1969: Ockhams Weg zur Sozialphilosophie (Berlin 1969).
• Schabel, C. 2000: Theology at Paris 1316–1345: Peter Auriol and the Problem of Divine Foreknoweldge and Future Contingents (= Ashgate Studies in Medieval Philosophy, 1) (Aldershot 2000).
• Schneider, N. 1991: Die Kosmologie des Franciscus de Marchia: Texte, Quellen, und Untersuchungen zur Naturphilosophie des 14. Jahrhunderts (= Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, 28) (Leiden 1991).
• Teetaert, A. 1933: “Pignano (François de),” Dictionnaire de Théologie Catholique XII (Paris 1933), cols. 2104–2109.
• Wittneben, E.L., and R. Lambertini 1999: “Un teologo francescano alle strette. Osservazioni sul testimone manoscritto del processo a Francesco d'Ascoli,” Picenum Seraphicum 18 n.s. (1999), 97–122.
• Zimmermann, A. 1966: “Allgemeine Metaphysik und Teilmetaphysik nach einen anonymen Kommentar zur aristotelischen Ersten Philosophie aus dem 14. Jahrhundert,” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 48 (1966), 190–206.

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