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2. Locke implied that a causal theory of perception is incompatible with the perception of holes; since holes are not material they cannot be the source of any causal flow. (This might be considered an instance of the argument ad 1.) That we do have the impression of perceiving holes should then be considered a sort of systematic illusion. (Unless one rejects causal accounts of perception.)
(a) Holes do not exist. This requires at least a systematic way of paraphrasing every hole-committing sentence by means of a sentence that does not refer to or quantify over holes. (The donut is holed, but there is no hole in it). Provided the language contains all the necessary shape-predicates, this might well be a favourable strategy: after all, holes are a paradigm example of nothings.
(b) Holes exist, but they are something else. For instance, they are (parts of) material objects, say, hole-linings or hole-surrounds. This calls for an account of the altered meaning of certain predicates or prepositions. (What would ‘inside’ and ‘outside’ mean? What would it mean to ‘enlarge’ a hole?)Or holes are negative, missing parts. On this account, a donut would be a sort of mereological sum of a pie and a mysterious missing bit in the middle. Or again, holes are not categorically homogeneous with their hosts. They are not particulars, but relations between a material object and a volume of space. (But now how can we account for the shape and size of holes? Relations do not have shapes and sizes.)
On the other hand, the possibility remains that holes be taken for what they are. They are full-fledged countable entities, like stones and chunks of cheese. But unlike stones and chunks of cheese, holes are ontologically parasitic: they are always in or through something else, and cannot be detached from their hosts. Holes are immaterial; localized at --but not identical with-- regions of space; fillable; and somehow causally liable. They are subject to part/whole structures. Yet holes are always in one piece--there is no such thing as half a hole.
Holes are topologically assorted: superficial hollows are distinguished from internal cavities; straight perforations are distinguished from knotted tunnels. But the hole realist will not fail to notice the unity of this assortment. These are all species of the same genus. Thus the underlying topology must depart from the basic account of handlebodies and calls for a direct analysis of their topological complements. Look at the donut, but keep an eye on the hole--or on what could fill it.
| Roberto Casati casati@ehess.fr |
Achille Varzi av72@columbia.edu |