This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Here is a proof that on Bradwardine's theory, every proposition signifies that it is true. Let P name the proposition replacing p. Then:
1. p Assume for conditional proof. 2. P signifies that q Assume for conditional proof. 3. p q From 2 and the thesis that what propositions signify follows from them. 4. q From 1, 3, and modus ponens 5. (P signifies that q) q From 2-4, by conditional proof. 6. P is true. From 5 and Bradwardine's definition of truth, since 5 is general with respect to propositions replacing q. 7. p P is true From 1-6, by conditional proof. 8. P signifies that P is true. From 7 and "Bradwardine's Principle."
Paul Vincent Spade spade@indiana.edu |