Proof of Step 1: A Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Spring 2003 Edition)

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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Proof of Step 1

A given point a₀ on the unit sphere E uniquely picks out a unit vector from the origin to a₀ which in turn uniquely picks out a ray in R3 through the origin and a₀. We here work with unit vectors, since this involves no loss of generality. We write a₀, a₁, ... for points and u(a₀), u(a₁), ... for the corresponding unit vectors. We call a KS diagram realizable on E, if there is a 1:1 mapping of points of E, and thus of vectors in R3, to vertices of the diagram such that the orthogonality relations in the diagram -- namely, vertices joined by a straight line represent mutually orthogonal points -- are satisfied by the corresponding vectors.

We now show (see Kochen and Specker 1967: , Redhead 1987: 126):

If vectors u(a₀) and u(a₉), corresponding to points a₀ and a₉ of the following ten-point KS graph ₁ are separated by an angle with 0 sin ^-1 (1/3), then ₁ is realizable.

Figure 4: Ten-point KS graph ₁

Suppose that theta

, the angle between u(a₀) and u(a₉), is any acute angle. Since u(a₈) is orthogonal to u(a₀) and u(a₉), and u(a₇) also is orthogonal to u(a₉), u(a₇) must lie in the plane defined by u(a₀) and u(a₉). Moreover, the direction of u(a₇) can be chosen such that, if phi

is the angle between u(a₀) and u(a₇), then phi

Now, let u(a₅) = i and u(a₆) = k and choose a third vector j such that i, j, k form a complete set of orthonormal vectors. Then u(a₁), being orthogonal to i, may be written as:

u(a₁) = (j + xk) (1 + x²) ^-1/2

for a suitable real number x, and similarly u(a₂), being orthogonal to k, may be written as:

u(a₂) = (i + yj) (1 + y²) ^-1/2

for a suitable real number y. But now the orthogonality relations in the diagram yield:

u(a₃) = u(a₅) × u(a₁) = (-xj + k) (1 + x²) ^-1/2
u(a₄) = u(a₂) × u(a₆) = (yi j) (1 + y²) ^-1/2

Now, u(a₀) is orthogonal to u(a₁) and u(a₂), so:

u(a₀) = u(a₁) × u(a₂) / ( | u(a₁) × u(a₂) | ) = (-xyi + xj k) (1 + x² + x² y²) ^-1/2

Similarly, u(a₇) is orthogonal to u(a₃) and u(a₄), so:

u(a₇) = u(a₄) × u(a₃) / ( | u(a₄) × u(a₃) | ) = (-i yj xyk) (1 + y² + x² y²) ^-1/2

Recalling now that the inner product of two unit vectors just equals the cosine of the angle between them, we get:

u(a₀) u(a₇) = cos = xy[(1 + x² + x² y²) (1 + y² + x² y²)] ^-1/2

Thus:

sin = xy[(1 + x² + x² y²) (1 + y² + x² y²)] ^-1/2

This expression achieves a maxium value of 1/3 for x = y = plus-or-minus

1. Hence, the diagram is realizable, if 0 less than or equal to

sin^-1(1/3), or, equivalently if 0 less than or equal to

sin

1/3.

Return to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Carsten Held
cheld@ruf.uni-freiburg.de

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Proof of Step 1

Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy