ukasiewicz, Gödel and product logic; a
short discussion on paradoxes and fuzzy logic; some comments on other
formal systems of fuzzy logic and finally, a few remarks on fuzzy
computing and bibliography.| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy |
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The term "fuzzy logic" emerged in the development of the theory of fuzzy sets by Lotfi Zadeh [Zadeh (1965)]. A fuzzy subset A of a (crisp) set X is characterized by assigning to each element x of X the degree of membership of x in A (e.g. X is a group of people, A the fuzzy set of old people in X). Now if X is a set of propositions then its elements may be assigned their degree of truth, which may be “absolutely true,” “absolutely false” or some intermediate truth degree: a proposition may be more true than another proposition. This is obvious in the case of vague (imprecise) propositions like “this person is old” (beautiful, rich, etc.). In the analogy to various definitions of operations on fuzzy sets (intersection, union, complement, …) one may ask how propositions can be combined by connectives (conjunction, disjunction, negation, …) and if the truth degree of a composed proposition is determined by the truth degrees of its components, i.e. if the connectives have their corresponding truth functions (like truth tables of classical logic). Saying “yes” (which is the mainstream of fuzzy logic) one accepts the truth-functional approach; this makes fuzzy logic to something distinctly different from probability theory since the latter is not truth-functional (the probability of conjunction of two propositions is not determined by the probabilities of those propositions).
Two main directions in fuzzy logic have to be distinguished (cf. Zadeh (1994)). Fuzzy logic in the broad sense (older, better known, heavily applied but not asking deep logical questions) serves mainly as apparatus for fuzzy control, analysis of vagueness in natural language and several other application domains. It is one of the techniques of soft-computing, i.e. computational methods tolerant to suboptimality and impreciseness (vagueness) and giving quick, simple and sufficiently good solutions. The monographs Novak (1989), Zimmermann (1991), Klir-Yuan (1996), Nguyen (1999) can serve as recommended sources of information.
Fuzzy logic in the narrow sense is symbolic logic with a comparative notion of truth developed fully in the spirit of classical logic (syntax, semantics, axiomatization, truth-preserving deduction, completeness, etc.; both propositional and predicate logic). It is a branch of many-valued logic based on the paradigm of inference under vagueness. This fuzzy logic is a relatively young discipline, both serving as a foundation for the fuzzy logic in a broad sense and of independent logical interest, since it turns out that strictly logical investigation of this kind of logical calculi can go rather far. A basic monograph is Hajek (1998), further recommended monographs are Turunen (1999), Novak et al. (2000); also recent monographs dealing with many-valued logic (not specifically oriented to fuzziness), namely Gottwald (2001), Cignoli et al. (2000a); are highly relevant.
The interested reader will find below some more information on fuzzy
connectives and a survey of a logical system called basic fuzzy
(propositional and predicate) logic together with three stronger
systems --
ukasiewicz, Gödel and product logic; a
short discussion on paradoxes and fuzzy logic; some comments on other
formal systems of fuzzy logic and finally, a few remarks on fuzzy
computing and bibliography.
The standard set of truth degrees
is the real interval [0,1] with its natural ordering
(1 standing for absolute truth, 0 for absolute falsity); but one can
work with different domains, finite or infinite, linearly or
partially ordered. Truth functions of connectives have to
behave classically on the extremal values 0,1.
It is broadly accepted that t-norms (triangular norms) are
possible truth functions of conjunction. (A binary operation
* on the interval [0,1] is a t-norm if it is commutative,
associative, non-decreasing and 1 is its unit element. Minimum
(min(x,y) is the most popular t-norm. See the
Glossary at the end.) Dually, t-conorms serve as truth
functions of disjunction. See
Klement et al. (2000)
for an extensive theory of t-norms. The truth function
of negation has to be non-increasing (and assign 0 to 1 and
vice versa); the function 1-x
(ukasiewicz negation) is the
best known candidate.
Implication is sometimes disregarded but is of fundamental
importance for fuzzy logic in the narrow sense. A straightforward but
logically less interesting possibility is to define implication
from conjunction and negation (or disjunction and negation) using
the corresponding tautology of classical logic; such implications
are called S-implications. More useful and interesting are
R-implications: an R-implication is defined as a residuum
of a t-norm; denoting the t-norm * and the residuum
we have
x y=
max{x| x*z
y}.
This is well-defined only if the t-norm is left-continuous.
Basic fuzzy propositional logic is the logic of continuous
t-norms (developed in
Hajek (1998)). Formulas are built from
propositional variables using connectives & (conjunction),
(implication) and truth constant 
(denoting
falsity). Negation
is defined as
.
Given a continuous t-norm * (and hence its residuum
)
each evaluation e of propositional variables by
truth degrees for [0,1] extends uniquely to the evaluation
e*()
of each formula
using * and
as truth functions of & and
.
is a t-tautology or standard
BL-tautology if
e*() = 1
for each evaluation e and
each continuous t-norm *.
The following t-tautologies are
taken as axioms of the logic BL:
(A1) ( )
)
(A2) ( (A3) ( (A4) ( (A5a) ( ))
(A5b) (( (A6) (( (A7)
Modus ponens is the only deduction rule; this gives the
usual notion of proof and provability of the logic BL.
The standard completeness theorem
[Cignoli et al. (2000b)] says that a
formula
is a t-tautology iff it is provable in BL.
There is a more general semantics of BL, based on algebras called
BL-algebras (see
Hajek (1998) for definition); each
BL-algebra can serve as the algebra of truth functions of BL. The
general completeness theorem
Hajek (1998) says that a formula
is provable in BL iff it is a general BL-tautology,
i.e. a tautology for each (linearly ordered) BL-algebra L.
Basic fuzzy predicate logic has the same formulas as
classical predicate logic (they are built from predicates of
arbitrary arity using object variables, connectives &,
,
truth constant
and quantifiers
,
. A standard interpretation is given
by a non-empty domain M and for each n-ary
predicate P by a n-ary fuzzy relation on
M, i.e., a mapping assigning to each n-tuple of
elements of M a truth value from [0,1] -- the degree in
which the n-tuple satisfies the atomic formula
P(x1,
…,xn). Given a continuous
t-norm, this defines uniquely (in Tarski style) the truth
degree |||| of each closed formula
given
by the interpretation M and t-norm *.
(The degree of an universally quantified formula
x
is defined as the infimum of truth degrees of instances of
; similarly
x
and supremum. See the Glossary at the end of this
entry.)
This generalizes in an appropriate manner to a so called safe
interpretation over any linearly ordered BL-algebra and
definition of the truth value
||||
M,L given by the
L-interpretation M. A formula is a general
BL-tautology in the predicate logic
BL
if its truth value is 1 in each safe interpretation.
The following BL-tautologies are taken as axioms of
BL: (a) axioms of the propositional logic BL,
and
Deduction rules are modus ponens and generalization as in classical logic.
( ( ( ( ( 
(where y is substitutable for x into
The general completeness theorem says that a formula is
provable in the fuzzy predicate logic
BL iff it is a general BL-tautology (of
predicate logic). This generalizes in a natural way to provability in
a theory over
BL and truth in all models of the theory; see
Hajek (1998) for details. But note that
standard BL-tautologies, i.e. formulas true in all standard
interpretations w.r.t. all continuous t-norms are not
recursively axiomatizable (see
Hajek 2001a),
Montagna (2001)
for the final result).
They define three corresponding notions of tautology (being
true in each evaluation w.r.t. the t-norm --
standard
L-tautologies, G-tautologies and
-tautologies.)
On the level of propositional logic they are completely axiomatized as
follows:
L -- BL plus the axiom G -- BL plus the axiom -- BL plus the axiom
This is standard completeness; we have also general
completeness with respect to BL-algebras satisfying the
corresponding additional conditions (making the additional axioms
true): they are called MV-algebras (for L), G-algebras (for
G) and product algebras (for
)
The corresponding predicate logics
L,
G,
are extensions of the basic predicate fuzzy logic
BL
by the just formulated axioms characterizing
L,G, .
Analogously to
BL
we have the general completeness theorem for predicate
logics: provability = general validity; for
G we have also standard completeness, but
neither standard L-tautologies nor standard
-tautologies
are recursively axiomatizable.
ukasiewicz logic
this is not the case: if
has the
value 0.5 then its negation
has the same value and is equivalent to
But one may ask if one can add to (classical) arithmetic a fuzzy
truth predicate Tr satisfying, for formulas of this extended
language, the disquotation schema
Tr(
), (where
The answer is “yes and no”: you get a theory which is consistent but has no model expanding the standard natural numbers. This is discussed in Hajek et al. (2000); see also Grim et al. (1992).
The Sorites paradox is related to notions like small, many etc.; considering them to be crisp (two-valued) leads to unnatural consequences. We shall sketch a treatment of the notion “small number” in fuzzy logic. (See Goguen (1968-69) for a “classic” analysis.) Without going into detail, imagine a theory inside fuzzy predicate calculus (BL or other)
containing crisp arithmetic of natural numbers (as above) and
an additional predicate Small with the axioms saying
that 0 is small (Small(0)), that Small
respects , i.e.,
and that for all x, the implication Small(x)
Small(x+1)
is almost true; finally that there is a non
small number,
(x)Small(x).
The “induction” condition can be expressed in various ways, e.g.,
where At is an unary connective “almost true”. Its truth function has to satisfy some natural conditions, in particular At(u)
u.
You can have At definable, introducing
a new propositional constant r that should be interpreted by a
truth value near to 1 and defining At to be
r,
thus the above formula becomes
You see that the theory admits many interpretations (and hence is consistent). All interpretations satisfy in some sense the following: the truth degree of Small(x+1) is only slightly less than (or equal to) the truth degree of Small(x). Thus the paradox can be handled in the frame of fuzzy logic in an axiomatic way, not enforcing any unique semantics. The semantics need not be numerical and the truth values need not be linearly ordered (there are BL algebras whose order is not linear).
Several other notions can be handled similarly; for example
the fuzzy notion probably can be axiomatized as a
fuzzy modality, having a probability on Boolean formulas,
define for each such formula
a new formula
P,
read “probably ”,
and define the truth value of
P
to be the probability of
.
One gets a reasonably elegant bridge between fuzziness
and probability, with a simple axiom system over
ukasiewicz logic. See
Hajek (1998);
for an axiomatization of “very true” see
Hajek (2001b).
We mention a few: First, there is Pavelka's logic
(ukasiewicz with rational
truth constants; see
Pavelka (1979),
Novak et al. (2000));
V. Novak systematically develops this logic as a logic with
evaluated syntax (working with pairs (formula, truth value)),
fuzzy theories (sets of evaluated formulas) and fuzzy modus ponens
[from (,u),
(,v)
derive
(,u*v)
where * is
ukasiewicz t-norm].
Second, several theories in the spirit of the logic BL
(BL) described above:
logics with an additional involutive negation
[Esteva et al. (2000)],
a logic putting
ukasiewicz product and Gödel
logic together
[Esteva et al. (1999),
Cintula (2001)],
and a logic based on left-continuous t-norms,
more general than BL
[Esteva et al. (2001)].
x A1 ... An y B1 ... Bn
Ai, Bi may be crisp (concrete numbers) or fuzzy (small, medium, …) It may be understood in two, in general non-equivalent ways: (1) as a listing of n possibilities, called Mamdani's formula:
(where x is A1 and y is B1 or x is A2 and y is B2 or …). (2) as a conjunction of implications:
MAMD(x,y) n
i=1(Ai(x) & Bi(y)).
(if x is A1 then y is B1 and …).
RULES(x,y) n
i=1(Ai(x)
Both MAMD and RULES define a binary fuzzy relation (given the interpretation of Ai's, Bi's and truth functions of connectives). Now given a fuzzy input A*(x) one can consider the image B* of A*(x) under this relation, i.e.,
B*(y)
where R(x,y) is MAMD(x,y) (most frequent case) or RULES(x,y). Thus one gets an operator assigning to each fuzzy input set A* a corresponding fuzzy output B*. Usually this is combined with some fuzzifications converting a crisp input x0 to some fuzzy A*(x) (saying something as "x is similar to x0") and a defuzzification converting the fuzzy image B* to a crisp output y0. Thus one gets a crisp function; its relation to the set of rules may be analyzed. For detailed information on fuzzy control see Driankov et al. (1993). (But be sure not to call minimum "Mamdani implication" -- minimum is not an implication at all! For logical analysis, see e.g., Hajek (2000).)
To help the reader not familiar with the basic notions of higher mathematics I comment here on two notions used:
Continuous t-norm. A t-norm is a particular operation
x*y with arguments and values in the real unit interval
[0,1]. Such an operation is continuous, intuitively
speaking, if small changes of the arguments lead only to small
changes of the result of the operation. Precisely, for each
>0 there is a 
>0
such that wherever
|x1-x2|< and
|y1-y2|< then
|(x1* y1) -
(x2* y2)|<.
Infimum and supremum of a subset of the real unit interval
[0,1]. Let A be a set of truth values, hence a subset of
[0,1]. A truth value x is a lower bound of
A if xy for each
element y of A; it is the infimum of
A if it is the largest lower bound (notation: x =
inf(A)). Clearly, if A has a least element then
this element is its infimum; but if A has no least element
then its infimum is not its element. For example if A is the
set of all positive truth values (x>0) then
inf(A)=0. Dually, x is an upper bound of
A if x
y for all
y in A; the supremum of A is its
least upper bound.
and
L1/2
propositional and predicate logics. Fuzzy Sets and Systems,
vol. 124/3, pp. 21-34, 2001.
ukasiewicz and product logic. Mathware and soft
computing 6 (1999), 219-234. | Petr Hajek hajek@cs.cas.cz |
