Notes

1. Observe, however, that while the formation rules for (,) allow the deployment of infinitely many quantifiers, each preformula can contain only finitely many alternations of quantifiers. Languages permitting infinite quantifier alternations have been developed in the literature, but we shall not discuss them here.

2. This remark loses its force when the base language contains predicate symbols with infinitely many argument places. However, this possibility is excluded here since our base language is a conventional first-order language.

3. I.e., such that no contradictions can be derived from using the deductive machinery in P.

4. If A is a set, | A denotes the membership relation on A, i.e., {<x, y> A × A: x y}.

5. Strictly speaking, this is only the case when is regular, that is, not the limit of < cardinals each of which is < . In view of the fact that "most" cardinals are regular, we shall take this as read.

6. It should be pointed out, however, that there are languages (,) apart from (,) and (₁,) which are complete; for example, all languages (⁺,) and (,) with inaccessible .

7. This is just a consequence of the fact that a first-order deduction is a finite sequence, hence a member of H().

8. Take to be any logically false sentence!

9. A set A is transitive if x y A x A.

10. For the definition of admissible set, see the Supplement at the end of §5.