Marsilius of Inghen
Marsilius of Inghen, master at the Universities of Paris (1362-1378)
and Heidelberg (1386-1396), wrote a number of treatises on logic and
natural philosophy popular at many late medieval and early modern
universities. He adopted the logico-semantic approach of William of
Ockham and John Buridan while at the same time defending the
traditional views of Thomas Aquinas and Bonaventure. His thinking
sheds light on the discussion between nominalists and realists and
allows insight into the changing interests of philosophy and
theology, from the critical attitude of many fourteenth-century
authors to the search for tradition which was characteristic of the
fifteenth century.
Marsilius of Inghen was born around 1340 in Nijmegen, a city in the
eastern part of the Low Countries (Netherlands). In the older
literature it is often said that he came from one of the villages in
the vicinity of Nijmegen (Inghen), but this view is mistaken. It was
based on a confused reading of the Oratio Funebris held in
1396 by Nicholas Prowin at the funeral of Marsilius and published in
1499 at Mainz. From 1362 on, Marsilius was master at the Faculty of
Arts at the University of Paris, where he was also rector (1367 and
1371), and a student of theology. As a teacher at Paris, Marsilius
was much esteemed and his lectures drew large audiences. Among his
students were many compatriots, some of whom came from Nijmegen and
surrounding villages. In 1378, Marsilius found himself the
University's delegate at the court of Pope Urban VI in
Tivoli. In 1379, he instructed one of his colleagues, Hugh of
Hervort, to look after his interests in Paris. After 1379,
Marsilius's name is no longer mentioned in the acts of the
University of Paris. He probably turned away from Paris because of
the imbroglio surrounding the Great Schism of 1378. Meanwhile, he
kept in touch with his native city. In 1382 the town council of
Nijmegen treated him to a banquet. From 1386 on, Marsilius was master
at the University of Heidelberg. There, as in Paris, he held a number
of administrative offices. He was one of the founders of the
University of Heidelberg, of which he was rector no fewer than nine
times, from 1386-1392 and also in 1396. In 1389-1390, as the
University's nuncio together with Conrad of Soltau, he
was responsible for transferring the University register to Rome
(Boniface IX). At the beginning of the 1390s, Marsilius again took up
the study of theology. The masters who taught theology were by then
Conrad of Soltau (since 1387) and Matthew of Krakow (since 1394),
both from the University of Prague. In 1395/1396 Marsilius finished
his lectures on the Sentences and so became the first
theologian to obtain the doctorate at Heidelberg. He died a short
time later, on August 20, 1396.
Marsilius was a prolific writer. His work was the fruit of his
teachings in Paris and Heidelberg. Many of his writings have been
preserved in manuscripts or early printed editions, although recently
some have appeared in modern critical editions. His most important
writings include:
Works on Logic and Epistemology
- Exposition of the Old Logic
- Various Questions on the Old and New Logic
- Summary [Abbreviationes] of the Old and New Logic
- Treatises on the Properties of Terms: On Supposition,
Ampliation, Appellation, Restriction, Obligation, Insolubles, and
Consequences.
Works on Natural Philosophy and Metaphysics
- Summary [Abbreviationes] of Aristotle's ‘Physics’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘On Generation and Corruption’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘De anima’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘Metaphysics’
Works on Theology
- Questions on the ‘Sentences’ of Peter Lombard
In his logic and epistemology, Marsilius followed the nominalist
tradition of the fourteenth century as exemplified by William of
Ockham and John Buridan. Yet Marsilius never qualified himself as a
nominalist or follower of Ockham. He was an independent thinker
who sometimes went back to the older tradition of the thirteenth
century (e.g., in Peter of Spain), or advocated theories which were more in
line with ordinary speech, as against the highly specialized views of
his contemporaries.
Marsilius's nominalism comes to the fore in his views on the
object of scientific knowledge, the nature of universals, and the
logical doctrine of supposition. His basic assumption is that there
are only individuals and no universals outside the human mind.
2.1.1 The Object of Scientific Knowledge
According to the Aristotelian standard accepted by Marsilius, the
object of scientific knowledge must be universal and necessarily
true. This is not the case with individual things in the external
world, since they are subject to change. Only the conclusion of a
true and necessary syllogism can meet the standard. Hence, for
Marsilius, the object of scientific knowledge is not anything outside
the mind, but the mental proposition which refers to individual
things and their qualities. More specifically, the proper object of
scientific knowledge is a proposition in the form of a conclusion
that has been deduced from necessary premises.
2.1.2 Universals
Marsilius argued that universal concepts such as ‘humanity’
do not refer to real universals outside the human mind. Accordingly,
there is no universal essence in singular individuals. Individuals of
one genus or species do resemble each other, however, and this
resemblance is the foundation of universal concepts in the human
mind. The generation of universal concepts is a natural process,
which Marsilius described as follows: suppose individual A of species
S evokes concept X in the human mind. This concept is similar to
concept Y which has been evoked by B of the same species S. By
abstracting from all the differences between X and Y, the human mind
is able to produce another concept, Z, which stands for both A and
B. Universality is then taken to be a quality of concept Z, the
product of the epistemological operation of abstraction on concepts X
and Y by the human mind.
2.1.3 Supposition
In line with his account of the nature of universals, Marsilius
rejected simple supposition. Logicians such as Peter of Spain had
used the notion to indicate that a term stood not for an individual
but for a universal or common nature in the external world, like the
term ‘man’ in the proposition, ‘Man is a
species’. Since Marsilius rejected the idea of universals
existing outside the mind, he eliminated simple supposition from the
list of different types of supposition. He was critical of some of
his contemporaries (e.g., Albert of Saxony) who likewise dismissed
the concept of real universals, yet kept on using the notion of
simple supposition. They had changed the meaning of the term, he
said, by claiming that a written or spoken term had simple
supposition if it was used to refer to a concept in the human
mind. Marsilius wondered whether young students would be able to
understand this new meaning of simple supposition, since they would
hardly know what concepts are. To avoid confusion, Marsilius decided
not to deal with simple supposition at all in his logic.
2.1.4 Some Specific Views
Marsilius was his own person when it came to assessing the views of
others. In his analysis of the proposition ‘Socrates is not a
chimera’ he followed what he called ‘the Parisian
method’, according to which the proposition is false because the
term ‘chimera’ supposits for nothing, there being no real
chimeras to which it can refer. Others, however, considered the
proposition to be true.
Elsewhere, he departed from the opinions of the Parisian School
(scola Parisiensis) and opted for the perspective of
ordinary language or common way of speaking (communis modus
loquendi). This was the case with his analysis of the
proposition ‘The Antichrist is not, but he will
be’. According to the Parisian School, the term ‘he’
refers to the thing referred to by the term
‘Antichrist’. Since there is no Antichrist, neither term
has reference. But in ordinary language it is different, for there
the term ‘he’ is meant to refer to the future
Antichrist. Marsilius accepted the latter analysis as sound, despite
the authority of the former.
Finally, in the definition of ampliation, Marsilius went back to
logicians of the thirteenth century such as Peter of Spain, who had
defined ampliation as an extension of supposition, whereas
fourteenth-century logicians such as Albert of Saxony did not
consider ampliation to be a kind of supposition. Marsilius
reinterpreted their definition so that it fit better with the older
tradition. Such efforts to harmonize older and newer positions were
typical of the late fourteenth century.
In natural philosophy and metaphysics Marsilius was an empiricist,
meaning that he thought all scientific knowledge must be based on
either sense data or self-evident propositions, i.e., propositions in
which the meaning of the predicate is included in the subject.
Everyone who knows the meaning of the terms of such propositions
judges them to be evidently true. This has far-reaching consequences
for the relationship between philosophy and theology. Since the
philosopher uses only sense data and self-evident propositions, his
inquiry may come to different conclusion than that of the theologian,
who has additional knowledge from scripture. The philosopher makes
judgments about the world from a limited human perspective, whereas
the theologian is helped by divine revelation. Yet Marsilius took the
task of the philosopher seriously because he thought the human mind
has a natural tendency to search for truth, which is satisfied
(although not ultimately satisfied) in natural philosophy and
metaphysics.
2.2.1 Creation
According to the principles of natural philosophy, creation from
nothing is impossible. The senses show that things always come from
other things. Because there is no serious reason to doubt the
information given by the senses, the human mind legitimately jumps to
the universal principle that nothing can come from nothing, driven by
the natural tendency to search for truth. Consequently, for the human
mind creation from nothing is impossible. It contradicts the
universal principle that nothing comes from nothing. That God has
created the world from nothing is therefore only a matter of faith
(sola fide est creditum). Revelation shows that human
knowledge of creation is limited, but it cannot be aided by natural
philosophy at this point.
2.2.2 Theory of the Human Soul
In the later Middle Ages the study of the soul was part of natural
philosophy. Marsilius treated the human soul in his commentary on
Aristotle's De anima, in which he followed the Parisian
tradition of Buridan and Oresme concerning the particular questions
addressed. Following Buridan, he argued that there is no natural
proof of the immortality of the human soul. For the human natural
mind, unaided by revelation, the theory of Alexander of Aphrodisias
that the human soul is corruptible is the most probable. That
Alexander of Aphrodisias is mistaken and that the soul continues to
exist after the death of the body is known through revelation
alone. Faith has more authority than human reason and must be
accepted in all cases where the two conflict since the things we
believe on faith come from God, who cannot err.
Although metaphysics cannot surpass the limits of human knowledge,
Marsilius considered it to be the entry point to theology. Natural
reason is capable of forming some adequate and true concepts of God,
but also of forming true propositions about God. It is able to prove
that God exists and possesses knowledge and will. But it cannot
demonstrate that God has free will or infinite power. This, Marsilius
claimed, was also true for philosophers such as Aristotle, whose
teachings equal those of natural reason itself.
From Buridan, Marsilius took the idea that God according to
Aristotle and Averroes is not only the final cause of the heavens and
separate substances, but also their efficient cause. On this point
Buridan and Marsilius were following the view of Scotus and Ockham
against that of John of Jandun, Johannes Baconis, and Gregory of
Rimini. It is worth noting in this connection that in the Puncta
super libros Metaphysicae (i.e., brief abstracts of
Aristotle's Metaphysics for teaching purposes)
attributed to Johannes de Slupcza and written in Krakow in 1433, some
of the views that Marsilius adopted from Buridan, including the one
just mentioned, are attributed to Marsilius instead of Buridan --
notwithstanding the fact that the author was familiar with both
Marsilius's and Buridan's commentaries. This illustrates
the strong influence Marsilius's work exerted on
fifteenth-century students and commentators.
Marsilius expressed his theological views in a voluminous commentary
on the Sentences. He quoted and often adopted views that
were put forward by fourteenth-century theologians such as Adam
Wodeham and Gregory of Rimini, but was also influenced by earlier
thinkers such as Thomas Aquinas and Bonaventure. He has serious
reservations about the use of logic in theology.
2.4.1 Attributes and ideas
In his discussion of the divine attributes he followed mainly the
teachings of Adam Wodeham. God is perfectly one. Divine wisdom and
all other perfections attributed to God are in reality as identical
to the divine essence as the divine essence is identical to
itself. In the divine essence itself there is no distinction or
non-identity whatsoever between the attributes of God. Any
distinctions between divine attributes are necessarily of a rational
(rather than real) nature and are made by us.
A similarly radical stance on the unity of God was assumed in his
treatment of divine ideas. Ideas are not formally distinct in God, as
some Scotists would argue, but only extrinsically and objectively
distinct. Their distinction is a consequence of the differences
between the creatures produced by God (which is why Marsilius spoke
of extrinsic distinction), and of the fact that they are known by God
as different (which accounts for their objective distinction). God
knows that he is the cause of infinitely many differences between
creatures. That is why his mind contains infinitely many different
ideas.
Marsilius criticized Ockham's view that God's idea
coincides with creation. If this were true, Marsilius argued, the
idea of producing a stone must be identical with either the stone
itself, or the stone insofar as it is known by God. If the former,
then God must look outside of himself in his idea, which contradicts
the position of Augustine, who is quoted by Ockham. If the latter,
then the idea of its production is not the stone itself, but rather
God's foreknowledge of the stone.
2.4.2 Theology and logic
Marsilius advanced his criticism of the use of logic in theology in
his discussion of the position of Robert Holcot. Holcot had argued
that logically, God can be called the cause of evil. If God is the
cause of every thing (entitas) and moral evil (malum
culpae) is a thing, then God is the cause of evil. Marsilius
acknowledged that the argument is based on true premises, yet the
conclusion should not be defended as true because it contradicts
faith and therefore might cause confusion among
believers. Theologians should not flaunt their personal skills in
logic, but always write out of reverence for the divine. Their
writings should not erode the beliefs of ordinary people, who are not
skilled in logic, but rather aim to strengthen them spiritually.
Marsilius was anxious, however, to avoid the implication that
God's foreknowledge is somehow dependent upon human beings. In
his discussion of Adam Wodeham on the causality of the human will, he
complained that Adam had not been emphatic enough on this point,
since he allowed the following argument: if an event E will
happen in the future, then God knows E from eternity; but if
not-E will happen, then God knows not-E form
eternity; since man is free, he can choose between E and
not-E; therefore, he can change God's
foreknowledge. This argument is logically sound, Marsilius argued,
but it easily leads to the false conclusion that God's knowledge
depends on the free will of man, which is absurd. The eternal cannot
fall under the power of that which is created by it. Therefore, this
argument should not be used. It is better to remain on the safe side
by maintaining what has always been maintained, namely that God
through his absolute omniscience knows the future activities of human
beings, but without being dependent on them.
2.4.3 The sacraments
In his treatment of the sacraments at the end of his commentary on
the Sentences, Marsilius drew heavily on the writings of
Thomas Aquinas and Bonaventure. He defended Thomas's view that
the word ‘this’ pronounced by Christ at the Last Supper in
uttering ‘This is my body’ (Mk. 14:22) refers to what the
bread and body have in common. Thomas of Strasbourg had attacked this
view, but Marsilius showed that the earlier Thomas was right and the
later wrong.
In his discussion of the causality of the sacraments, Marsilius
followed the exposition of Bonaventure, according to whom the
sacraments have no causality of their own. It is God who acts
whenever the sacraments are administered correctly. Only in a broad
sense is it true to say that the sacraments have the power to act.
The influence of Marsilius has been considerable, particularly
through his logical works and commentaries on Aristotle. This may be
gathered not only from the large number of manuscripts that have been
preserved, but also from several other
considerations. Marsilius's commentary on Aristotle's
Prior analytics was used in Prague in the 1380s. His logical
works, including the Obligationes and the
Consequentiae, were used as textbooks in Vienna in the
1390s. His commentaries on Aristotle's Metaphysics and
Physics were read in Krakow during the first sixty years of
the fifteenth century. At the universities of Heidelberg, Erfurt,
Basle, and Freiburg, his works were studied throughout the fifteenth
century, in particular as part of the university curriculum. In 1499,
the doctors and masters of the Via Moderna at the University
of Heidelberg published a volume that included epigrams on Marsilius
by well-known humanists such as Jacob Wimpfeling, as well as a
defense of Nominalism in the style of Marsilius (Via
Marsiliana). Praise in the form of epigrams can also be found in
the 1501 Strasbourg edition of Marsilius's commentary on the
Sentences. The Obligationes, printed in 1489 under
the name of Peter of Ailly, were used by Thomas Bricot, John Major,
and Domingo de Soto. The commentary on the Prior Analytics
was quoted by Agostino Nifo. Jodocus Trutvetter and Bartholomew of
Usingen, who consolidated nominalism in Erfurt, repeatedly mentioned
Marsilius in their works. Both Leonardo da Vinci and Galileo Galilei
referred to Marsilius's commentary on De Generatione et
Corruptione.
The theological views of Marsilius appear to have had some
circulation as well. His commentary on the Sentences was
known in Krakow in the first half of the fifteenth century, and was
used by Thomas de Strampino in his Principia
(1441-1442). The University of Salamanca had a theological chair
(Cátedra de Nominales) for commentary on the works of
Marsilius of Inghen and Gabriel Biel. His commentary on the
Sentences was quoted by Spanish theologians such as
Francisco de Vitoria, Domingo de Soto, Luis de Molina, and Francisco
Suárez, usually in connection with questions about divine
foreknowledge and grace.
There are nine extant manuscripts of Marsilius's commentary on
the Sentences. Among the former owners of these manuscripts
were two libraries for preachers (Ansbach and Isny), and two
libraries of faculties of arts (Erfurt and Leipzig). The education in
Erfurt and Leipzig included the reading of nominalist authors. In all
probability, the artists became interested in Marsilius's
theological work after studying his writings on logic and
physics. The presence of Marsilius's commentary on the
Sentences in preachers' libraries bears witness to the
fact that the impact of his work was felt beyond university circles.
Catalogue of works and bibliography
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., "Marsilius von Inghen:
Bibliographie. Appendix zu der geplanten Edition der wichtigsten Werk
des Marsilius von Inghen," Bulletin de Philosophie
Médiévale 31 (1989), 150-167.
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., Marsilius von Inghen:
"Bibliographie. Ergänzungen," Bulletin de Philosophie
Médiévale 31 (1990), 191-195.
- Lohr, Ch. H., "Medieval Latin Aristotle Commentaries. Authors:
Johannes de Kanthi-Myngodus," Traditio 27 (1971), 251-351.
- Markowski, M.,"Katalog dziel Marsyliusza z Inghen z ewidencja
rekopisow," Studia Mediewistyczne 25 (1988), 39-132.
Modern editions
- Marsilius of Inghen, Quaestiones super quattuor libros
Sententiarum, vol. 1: Super primum, quaestiones 1-7,
ed. G. Wieland, M. Santos Noya, M. J. F. M. Hoenen, M. Schulze,
Studies in the History of Christian Thought 87, ed. M. Santos Noya,
Leiden 2000.
- Marsilius of Inghen, Quaestiones super quattuor libros
Sententiarum, vol. 2: Super primum, quaestiones 8-21,
ed. G. Wieland, M. Santos Noya, M. J. F. M. Hoenen, M. Schulze,
Studies in the History of Christian Thought 88, ed. M. Santos Noya,
Leiden 2000.
- Marsilius of Inghen, Treatises on the Properties of
Terms. A First Critical Edition of the Suppositiones,
Ampliationes, Appellationes, Restrictiones and Alienationes with
Introduction, Translation, Notes, and Appendices, ed. E. P. Bos,
Synthese Historical Library 22, Dordrecht 1983.
Secondary Literature
- Braakhuis, H. A. G., and M. J. F. M. Hoenen (eds.), Marsilius
of Inghen, Artistarium Supplementa 7, Nijmegen 1992 [contains
partial editions of works of Marsilius].
- Hoenen M. J. F. M., "Der Sentenzenkommentar des Marsilius von
Inghen († 1396). Aus dem Handschriftenbestand des Tübinger
Wilhelmsstifts," Theologische Quartalschrift 171 (1991),
114-129.
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., and P. J. J. M. Bakker (eds.),
Philosophie und Theologie des ausgehenden Mittelalters. Marsilius
von Inghen und das Denken seiner Zeit, Leiden 2000 [contains
partial editions of works of Marsilius].
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., Marsilius of Inghen. Divine Knowledge in
Late Medieval Thought, Studies in the History of Christian
Thought 50, Leiden 1993.
- Marshall P., "Parisian Psychology in the Mid-Fourteenth Century,"
Archives d'histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen
Age 50 (1983), 101-193.
- Möhler W., Die Trinitätslehre des Marsilius von
Inghen. Ein Beitrag zur Geschichte der Theologie des
Spätmittelalters, Limburg/Lahn 1949.
- Reina M. E., "Comprehensio veritatis. Una questione di
Marsilio di Inghen sulla Metafisica," Filosofia e teologia nel
trecento. Studi in ricordo di Eugenio Randi, ed. L. Bianchi,
Textes et Études du Moyen Age 1, Louvain-la-Neuve 1994,
283-335.
- Ritter, G., Studien zur Spätscholastik I: Marsilius von
Inghen und die okkamistische Schule in Deutschland, Heidelberg
1921.
- Wielgus, S. (ed.), Marsilius von Inghen. Werk und
Wirkung. Akten des Zweiten Internationalen
Marsilius-von-Inghen-Kongresses, Lublin 1993 [contains partial
editions of works of Marsilius].
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Buridan, John [Jean] |
Gregory of Rimini |
Ockham [Occam], William
Copyright © 2001
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy