Notes

2. One might wish to understand the probabilistic relations stated in this principle as a definition of what a common cause is. However, this is not a plausible idea. For, consider a case in which A₁ is a common cause of A₂ and A₃, while A₂ in its turn causes A₄, and A₃ in its turn causes A₅, where A₄ and A₅ are simultaneous. In this case A₄ and A₅ will typically be uncorrelated conditional upon A₂ (assuming that A₂ is the only cause of A₄). Moreover, an occurrence of A₂ will typically make an occurrence of A₄ more likely, and, typically, it will make an occurrence of A₅ more likely. Thus A₂ would count as a common cause of A₄ and A₅ if the above probabilistic relations were a definition of what it is to be a common cause. But by assumption A₂ is not a cause of A₅, and thus not a common cause of A₄ and A₅. Thus the probabilistic relations that are used to state Reichenbach's principle of the common cause should not be regarded as a definition of what a common cause is.

3. Q_k is an indirect cause of Q_p exactly when there is a chain of direct causes starting at Q_k and ending at Q_p. Q_p is an effect of Q_k iff Q_k is a cause of Q_p iff Q_k is a direct or indirect cause of Q_p.

4. Let me explain how this follows from the Markov condition using terminology and theorems from Spirtes, Glymour and Scheines 1993, chapter 3. Let us call a quantity Q_c a ‘forking path common cause’ of quantities Q_a and Q_b if and only if there exists a path that always goes causally downstream from Q_c to Q_a, a path that always goes causally downstream from Q_c to Q_b, and these paths do not have any vertices other than Q_c in common. Let us now conditionalize on all the forking path common causes of Q_a and Q_b. Claim: Every path from Q_a to Q_b will then be inactive. (Paths here are assumed not to contain any vertex more than once.) Let me indicate how to prove this claim.

If such a path P starts at Q_a going causally downstream, then it will at some point have to switch to going causally upstream, since Q_a is not a cause of Q_b. It will thus contain a collider. This collider will be inactive since we are not conditionalizing on it nor on any quantity that is a descendent of it, since we are conditionalizing only on quantities that are causally upstream from Q_a. (I am assuming that the graphs are not cyclical.) Thus such a path P will be inactive. Now consider any path P from Q_a to Q_b that starts at Q_a going causally upstream. There must be some point Q_c at which point P first starts going causally downstream (since Q_b is not a cause of Q_a). There are two possibilities: P keeps going causally downstream all the way until it reaches Q_b, or it reaches a collider Q_d where P switches back to going causally upstream again. In the first case, Q_c is a common cause of Q_a and Q_b. So we have conditionalized on it, so P is inactive. In the second case, Q_d is a collider. There are then 2 subcases: Q_d does not lie causally upstream from a forking path common cause of Q_a and Q_b, or it does. If Q_d does not lie causally upstream from a common cause, then it does not lie upstream from a quantity that is conditionalized upon, so the collider is inactive, so P is inactive. If Q_d does lie causally upstream from a forking path common cause of Q_a and Q_b, then there must be a downstream path P from Q_d to Q_b. There are now 2 sub-subcases to consider.

Sub-subcase i: P has no vertices in common with the part of path P that lies between Q_a and Q_c. In that case, Q_c is a forking path common cause of Q_a and Q_b: to go downstream from Q_c to Q_a, follow the part of P that lies between Q_c and Q_a;to go downstream from Q_c to Q_b (without intersecting the path to Q_a), first take the part of P that lies between Q_c and Q_d, and then follow P to Q_b. So in this case we have conditionalized upon Q_c on P, so P is inactive.

Sub-subcase ii: every downstream path P from Q_d to Q_b intersects somewhere with the part of P that lies between Q_a and Q_c. Take some such P, and consider the furthest point Q_e downstream along P at which P intersects with P between Q_a and Q_c. Such a Q_e must be a forking path common cause of Q_a and Q_b: follow P to get to Q_a, follow P to get to Q_b. Thus we have conditionalized upon Q_e which lies on P. Thus P is inactive.

Thus any path P from Q_a to Q_b must be inactive once we have conditionalized upon all forking path common causes. Thus Q_a and Q_b are independent conditional upon a subset of all common causes of Q_a and Q_b.

5. The law of conditional independence is not violated by this type of case.

6. Let me sketch a proof. Any probability distribution that is allowed by the independence condition can be generated as follows. Assign some probability distribution over all the determinants outside S. By assumption this must be a probability distribution that is jointly independent, i.e. a product of distributions for each such determinant. Now first look at the set S₁ of quantities in S that have no direct causes in S. The probability distribution over these quantities will be determined by the distribution of their determinants outside S, and hence be a jointly independent distribution. Now look at the set S₂ of quantities all of whose direct causes in S are in S₁. The probability distribution over any quantity S₂ is obtained by multiplying the probability distributions of its direct causes in S₁ with the probability distribution of its determinant outside S. (At least, this is so if all distinct values of direct causes of Q in S and determinants of Q outside S, determine distinct values of Q. This may not be so, but this does not affect the independence claims that I am making here.) And let us continue in this way with S₃, .... until we have a distribution over all quantities in S. The only correlations in the joint distribution over quantities in S that will now occur will be between causes and their effects, and between the effects of a common cause. For consider any quantities Q₁ and Q₂ that are not so related. They will have no ‘ultimate inputs’ (the determinants outside S that determine the values of these quantities) in common, so the sets of ‘ultimate inputs’ for Q₁ and ‘ultimate inputs’ for Q₂ are independent, which entails that Q₁ and Q₂ are themselves independent. Moreover, the correlations between any two quantities Q₁ and Q₂ that are not related as cause and effect will disappear when one conditionalizes upon the direct causes of one of them, say Q₁. For the only remaining input into Q₁ is independent of anything other than effects of Q₁. So Q₁ is independent of anything other than effects of Q₁ conditional upon the direct causes of Q₁. Hence, the causal Markov condition holds.