Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Experiment in Physics
Appendix 1: The Discovery of Parity Nonconservation
Let us consider first an episode in which the relation between theory
and experiment was clear and straightforward. This was a "crucial"
experiment, one that decided unequivocally between two competing
theories, or classes of theory. The episode was that of the discovery
that parity, mirror-reflection symmetry or left-right symmetry, is not
conserved in the weak interactions. (For details of this episode see
Franklin (1986, Ch. 1)). Parity conservation was a well-established
and strongly-believed principle of physics. As students of
introductory physics learn, if we wish to determine the magnetic force
between two currents we first determine the direction of the magnetic
field due to the first current, and then determine the force exerted
on the second current by that field. We use two Right-Hand Rules. We
get exactly the same answer, however, if we use two Left-Hand Rules,
This is left-right symmetry, or parity conservation, in
electromagnetism.
In the early 1950s physicists were faced with a problem known as the
"
-
" puzzle. Based on one set
of criteria, that of mass and lifetime, two elementary particles (the
tau and the theta) appeared to be the same, whereas on another set of
criteria, that of spin and intrinsic parity, they appeared to be
different. T.D. Lee and C.N. Yang (1956) realized that the problem
would be solved, and that the two particles would be different decay
modes of the same particle, if parity were not conserved in the decay
of the particles, a weak interaction. They examined the evidence for
parity conservation and found, to their surprise, that although there
was strong evidence that parity was conserved in the strong (nuclear)
and electromagnetic interactions, there was, in fact, no supporting
evidence that it was conserved in the weak interaction. It had never
been tested.
Lee and Yang suggested several experiments that would test their
hypothesis that parity was not conserved in the weak interactions. One
was the 
decay of oriented
nuclei (Figure 1). Consider a collection
of radioactive nuclei, all of whose spins point in the same
direction. Suppose also that the electron given off in the radioactive
decay of the nucleus is always emitted in a direction opposite to the
spin of the nucleus In the mirror the electron is emitted in the same
direction as the spin. The mirror image of the decay is different from
the real decay. This would violate parity conservation, or mirror
symmetry. Parity would be conserved only if, in the decay of a
collection of nuclei, equal numbers of electrons were emitted in both
directions. This was the experimental test performed by C.S. Wu and
her collaborators (1957). They aligned Cobalt60 nuclei and
counted the number of decay electrons in the two directions, along the
nuclear spin and opposite to the spin. Their results are shown in
Figure 2 and indicate clearly that more
electrons are emitted opposite to the spin than along the spin. Parity
is not conserved.
Two other experiments, reported at the same time, on the sequential
decay pi meson decays to mu meson decays to electron also showed
parity nonconservation (Friedman and Telegdi 1957; Garwin, Lederman
and Weinrich 1957). These three experiments decided between two
classes of theories--that is, between those theories that conserve
parity and those that do not. They refuted the theories in which
parity was conserved and supported or confirmed those in which it
wasn't. These experiments also demonstrated that charge conjugation,
or particle-antiparticle, symmetry was violated in the weak
interactions and called for a new theory of decay and the weak
interactions. It is fair to say that when a physicist learned the
results of these experiments they were convinced that parity was not
conserved in the weak interactions.
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Supplement to Experiment in Physics
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy