Structuralism in Physics
Under the heading of “structuralism in physics” there are
three different but closely related research programs in philosophy
of science and, in particular, in philosophy of physics. These
programs were initiated by the work of Joseph Sneed, Günther
Ludwig, and Erhard Scheibe, respectively, since the begin of the
1970s. For the sake of simplicity we will use these names in order
to refer to the three programs, without the intention of ignoring or
minimizing the contributions of other scholars. (See the
Bibliography.) The term “structuralism” was originally
claimed by the Sneed school, see e.g., Balzer and Moulines (1996),
but it also appears appropriate to subsume Ludwig's and Scheibe's
programs under this title because of the striking similarities of the
three approaches. The activities of the structuralists have been
mainly confined to Europe, especially Germany, and, for whatever
reasons, largely ignored in the Anglo-American discussion.
The three programs share the following characteristics and convictions:
- A metatheory of science requires a kind of formalization different
from that already employed by scientific theories themselves.
- The structuralistic program yields a framework for the rational
reconstruction of particular theories.
- A central tool of formalization is Bourbaki's concept of
“species of structures”, as described in Bourbaki (1986).
- Among the significant features of theories to be described are:
- Mathematical structure
- Empirical claims of a theory
- Function of theoretical terms
- Rôle of approximation
- Evolution of theories
- Intertheoretic relations
A physical theory T consists, among other things, of a group
of laws which are formulated in terms of certain concepts. But an
apparent circularity arises when one considers how the laws of
T and the concepts acquire their content, because each seems
to acquire content from the other -- the laws of T acquire
their content from the concepts used in the formulation of the laws,
while the concepts are often “introduced” or
“defined” by the group of laws as a whole. To be sure, if
the concepts can be introduced independently of the theory
T, the circularity does not appear. But typically every
physical theory T requires some new concepts which cannot be
defined without using T (we call the latter
“T-theoretical concepts”). Is the apparent
circularity concerning the laws and the T-theoretical concepts a
problem? Some examples will help us assess the threat.
As an example, consider the theory T of classical particle
mechanics. For simplicity we will assume that kinematical concepts,
such as the positions of particles, their velocities and
accelerations are given independently of the theory as functions of
time. A central statement of T is Newton's second law,
F=ma, which asserts
that the sum F of the forces exerted upon a
particle equals its mass m multiplied by its acceleration
a.
While we customarily think of
F=ma as an empirical
assertion, there is a real risk that it turns out merely to be a
definition or largely conventional in character. If we think of a
force merely as “that which generates acceleration” then
the force F is actually defined by the
equation F=ma. We have a
particle undergoing some given acceleration
a, then
F=ma just defines what
F is. The law is not an empirically
testable assertation at all, since a force so defined cannot fail to
satisfy F=ma. The problem
gets worse if we define the (inertial) mass m in the usual
manner as the ratio
|F|/|a|. For now
we are using the one equation
F=ma to define two
quantities F and m. A given
acceleration a at best specifies the ratio
F/m but does not specify unique
values for F and m individually.
In more formal terms, the problem arises because we introduced force
F and mass m as
T-theoretical terms that are not given by other
theories. That fact also supplies an escape from the problem. We can
add extra laws to the simple dynamics. For example, we might require
that all forces are gravitational and that the net force on the mass
m be given by the sum
F=
iFi
of all gravitational forces
Fi acting on the mass
due to the other masses of the universe, in accord with Newton's
inverse square law of gravity. (The law asserts that the force
Fi due to attracting
mass i with gravitational mass
mgi is
Gmgmgiri
/ ri3, where
mg is the gravitational mass of the
original body, ri the
position vector of mass i originating from the original
body, and G the universal constant of gravitation.) That
gives us an independent definition for
F. Similarly we can require that the
inertial mass m be equal to the gravitational mass
mg. Since we now have independent access
to each of the terms F, m and
a appearing in
F=ma, whether the law
obtains is contingent and no longer a matter of definition.
Further problems can arise, however, because of another
T-theoretical term that is invoked implicitly when
F=ma is asserted. The
accelerations a are tacitly assumed to be
measured in relation to an inertial system. If the acceleration is
measured in relation to a different reference system, a different
result is obtained. For example, if it is measured in relation to a
system moving with uniform acceleration A,
then the measured acceleration will be
a
=
(a 
A). A body not acted on by gravitational
forces in an inertial frame will obey 0=ma
so that a=0. The same body in the
accelerated frame will have acceleration
a =
-A and be governed by
-mA =
ma.
The problem is that the term
-mA behaves just like a gravitational
force; its magnitude is directly proportional to the mass m
of the body. So the case of a gravitation free body in a uniformly
accelerated reference system is indistinguishable from a body in free
fall in a homogeneous gravitational field. A theoretical
underdetermination threatens once again. Given just the motions how
are we to know which case is presented to
us?[1]
Resolving these problems requires a systematic study of the
relations between the various T-theoretical concepts,
inertial mass, gravitational mass, inertial force, gravitational
force, inertial systems and accelerated systems and how they figure
in the relevant laws of the theory T.
Similar problems arise in the formulation of almost all fundamental
physical theories.
There are various ways to cope with this problem. One could try to
unmask it as a pseudo-problem. Or one could try to accept the problem
as part of the usual way science works, albeit not in the clean manner
philosophers would like it. The structuralistic programs, however,
agree that this is a non-trivial problem to be solved and devise
meta-theoretical machinery to enable its solution. They further agree
on dividing the vocabulary of the theory T into
T-theoretical and T-non-theoretical terms, the
latter being provided from outside the theory.
In the Sneedean approach the “empirical claim” of the
theory is formulated by using an existential quantifier for the
T-theoretical terms (i.e., in terms of the “Ramsey
sentence” for T). In our above example, Newton's law
for gravitational forces would be reformulated as: “There exist
an inertial system and constants G,
mi, mgi
such that for each particle the product of its mass times its
acceleration equals the sum of the gravitational forces as given
above.” This removes the circularity but leaves open the
question of content. Here the structuralists à la Sneed would
argue that the empirical claim of the theory
T
has to contain all the laws of the theory as well as
higher-order laws, called “constraints”. In our example,
the constraints would be statements such as “all particles have
the same inertial and gravitational masses and the gravitational
constant assumes the same value in all models of the theory.”
The theory would thereby acquire more content and become non-vacuous.
Although Ludwig's meta-theoretical framework is slightly different,
the first part of his solution is essentially equivalent to the above
one. On the other hand, he proposes a stronger program
(“axiomatic basis of a physical theory”) which proceeds by
considering an equivalent form T* of a theory T
in which all T-theoretical concepts are eliminated by
explicit definitions. This seems to be at variance with older results
about the non-definability of theoretical terms, but a closer
inspection removes the apparent contradiction. For example, the
concept of “mass” may be non-definable in a theory dealing
only with single orbits of a mechanical system, but definable in a
theory containing all possible orbits of that system.
However, to formulate the axiomatic basis of a real theory, not just
a toy model, is a non-trivial task and typically requires one or two
books; see the examples Ludwig (1985, 1987) and Schmidt (1979).
Both programs address the further problem of how to determine the
extension, e.g., the numerical values, of a theoretical term from a
given set of observational data. We will call this the
“measurement problem”, not to be confounded with the
well-known measurement problem in quantum theory. Typically the
measurement problem has no unique solution. Rather the values of the
theoretical quantities can only be measured within a certain degree of
imprecision and using auxilary assumptions which, although plausible,
are not confirmed with certainty. In the above Newton example one would have
to use the auxilary assumption that the trajectories of the particles are twice
differentiable and that other forces except the gravitational forces can be neglected.
The feature of imprecision and approximation plays a prominent
rôle in the structuralistic programs. In the context of the
measurement problem, imprecision seems to be a defect of the theory
which impedes the exact determination of the theoretical
quantities. However, imprecision and non-uniqueness is crucial in the
context of evolution of theories and the transition to new and
“better” theories.
Otherwise the new theory could in
general not encompass the successful applications of the old
theory.
Consider for example the transition of Kepler's theory of planetary motion to Newton's
and Einstein's theories:
Newtonian gravitation theory and general relativity replace
the Kepler ellipses with more complicated curves. But these should still be
consistent with the old astronomical observations, which is only
possible if they don't fit exactly into Kepler's theory .
Part of the structuralistic program is the definition of various
intertheoretic relations. Here we will concentrate on the relation(s)
of “reduction”, which play an important rôle in the
philosophical discourse as well as in the work of the physicists,
albeit not under this name. Consider a theory T which is
superseded by a better theory
T.
One could use
T
in order to understand some of the successes and failures of
T. If there is some systematic way of deriving T as
an approximation within
T, then
T is “reduced” to or by
T.
In this case, T is successful where it is a
good approximation to
T
and
T
is successful. On the other hand, in situations where
T
is still successful but T is a poor approximation to
T,
T will fail. For example, classical mechanics should be
obtained as the limiting case of relativistic mechanics for
velocities small compared with the velocity of light. This would
explain why classical mechanics was, and is still, successfully
applied in the case of small velocities but fails for large
(relative) velocities.
As mentioned, the investigation of such reduction relations between
different theories is part of the every-day work of theoretical
physicists, but usually they do not adopt a general concept of
reduction. Rather they intuitively decide what has to be shown or to
be calculated, depending on the case under consideration. Here the
work of the structuralists could lead to a more systematic approach
within physics, although there does not yet exist a generally
accepted, unique concept of reduction.
Another aspect is the rôle of reduction within the global
picture of the development of physics. Most physicists, but not all,
tend to view their science as an enterprise which accumulates
knowledge in a continuous manner. For example, they would not say that
classical mechanics has been disproved by relativistic mechanics, but
that relativistic mechanics has partly clarified where classical
mechanics could be safely applied and where not. This view of the
development of physics has been challenged by some philosophers and
historians of science, especially by the writings of T. Kuhn and
P. Feyerabend. These scholars emphasize the conceptual discontinuity
or “incommensurability” between reduced theory T
and reducing theory
T.
The structuralistic accounts of reduction now opens the possibility
of discussing these matters on a less informal level. The preliminary
results of this discussion are different depending on the particular
program.
In the writings of Ludwig there is no direct reference to the
incommensurability thesis and the corresponding discussion. But
obviously his approach implies the most radical denial of this
thesis. His reduction relation is composed of two simpler
intertheoretic relations called “restriction” and
“embedding”. They come in two versions, exact and
approximate. Part of their definitions are detailed rules of
translation of the non-theoretic vocabulary of
T
into that of T. Hence commensurability, at least on the
non-theoretical level, is insured by definition. The problem is then
shifted to the task of showing that some of the interesting cases of
reduction, which are discussed in the context of incommensurability,
fit into Ludwig's definition. Unfortunately, he gives only one
extensively worked-out example of reduction, namely thermodynamics
vs. quantum statistical mechanics, in Ludwig (1987).
Incommensurability of theoretical terms could probably be more easily
incorporated in Ludwig's approach since it could be traced back to
the difference between the laws of T and
T.
The relation between incommensurability and the Sneedean reduction
relation is to some extent discussed in Balzer et al. (1987,
chapter VI.7). The authors consider an exact reduction relation as a
certain relation between potential models of the respective theories.
More interesting for physical real-life examples is the approximate
version which is obtained as a “blurred exact reduction” by
means of a subclass of an empirical uniformity on the classes of
potential models. The Kepler-Newton case is discussed as an example
of approximate reduction. The discussion of incommensurability
suffers from the notorious difficulties of explicating such notions
as “meaning preserving translation”. There is an
interesting application of the interpolation theorem of
meta-mathematics which yields the result that, roughly speaking,
(exact) reduction implies translation. However, the relevance of this
result is questioned in Balzer et al. (1987, 312 ff). Thus
the discussion eventually ends up as inconclusive, but the authors
admit the possibility of a spectrum of incommensurabilities of
different degrees in cases of pairs of reduced/reducing theories.
Scheibe in his (1999) also explicitly refers to the theses of Kuhn and
Feyerabend and gives a detailed discussion. Unlike the other two
structuralistic programs, he does not propose a fixed concept of
reduction. Rather he suggests a lot of special reduction relations
which can be combined appropriately to connect two theories T
and
T.
Moreover, he proceeds by means of extensive real-life case studies
and considers new types of reduction relations if the case under
consideration cannot be described by the relations considered so
far. Scheibe concedes that there are instances of incommensurability
which make it difficult to find a reduction relation in certain
cases. As a significant example he mentions the notions of an
“observable” in quantum mechanics on the one hand, and in
classical statistical mechanics on the other hand. Although there are
maps between the respective sets of observables, Scheibe considers
this as a case of incommensurability, since these maps are not Lie
algebra homomorphisms, see Scheibe (1999, 174).
Summarizing, the structuralistic approaches are capable of discussing
the issues of reduction and incommensurability and the underlying
problems on an advanced level. Thereby these approaches have a chance
of mediating between disparate camps of physicists and philosophers.
In this section we will describe more closely the particular programs, their
roots and some of the differences between them.
This program has been the most successful with respect to the
formation of a “school” attracting scholars and students who
adopt the approach and work on its specific problems. Hence most of
the structuralistic literature concerns the Sneedean variant. Perhaps
this is partly also due to the circumstance that only Sneed's approach
is intended to apply (and has been applied) to other sciences and not
only physics.
The seminal book was Sneed (1971) which presented a meta-theory of
physics in the model-theoretical tradition connected with P. Suppes,
B. C. van Fraassen, and F. Suppe. This approach was adopted and
popularized by the German philosopher W. Stegmüller, see e.g.,
Stegmüller (1979) and further developed mainly by his disciples.
In its early days the approach was called the “non-statement
view” of theories, emphasizing the rôle of set-theoretical
tools as opposed to linguistic analyses. Later this aspect was
considered to be more of practical importance than a matter of
principle, see Balzer et al. (1987, 306 ff). Nevertheless,
the almost exclusive use of set-theoretic tools remains one of the
characteristic stylistic features of this program and one that
distinguishes it conspicuously from the other programs.
According to Moulines, in Balzer and Moulines (1996, 12-13), the
specific notions of the Sneedean program are the following. We
illustrate these notions by simplified examples, inspired by Balzer
et al. (1987), which are based on a system of N
classical point particles coupled by springs satisfying Hooke's law.
| Mp |
A class of potential models (the theory's
conceptual framework)
[One potential model contains a set of particles, a
set of springs together with their spring constants, the masses of
the particles, as well as their positions and mutual forces as
functions of time.] |
| M |
A class of actual models (the theory's empirical laws)
[M is the subclass of potential models
satisfying the system's equation of motion. ] |
| <Mp,M> |
A model-element (the absolutely necessary portion
of a theory) |
| Mpp |
A class of partial potential models (the theory's
relative non-theoretical basis)
[One partial potential model contains only the
particles' positions as functions of time, since the masses and
forces are considered as T-theoretical.] |
| C |
A class of constraints (conditions connecting
different models of one and the same theory)
[The constraints say that the same particles have the
same masses and the same springs have the same spring
constants.] |
| L |
A class of links (conditions connecting models of
different theories)
[Among the conceivable links are:
- Links to the theory of classical spacetime
- Links to the theory of weights and balances, where mass ratios can
be measured
- Links to theories of elasticity, where spring constants can be
calculated]
|
| A |
A class of admissible blurs (degrees of
approximation admitted between different models)
[The functions occuring in the potential models are
complemented by suitable error bars. These may depend on the
intended applications, see below.] |
K =
<Mp,M,Mpp,C,L,A> |
A core (the formal-theoretical part of a theory) |
| I |
The domain of intended applications (“pieces of the
world” to be explained, predicted or technologically manipulated)
[This class is open and contains, for example
- systems of small rigid bodies, connected by coil springs or
rubber bands
- any vibrating mechanical system in the case of small
amplitudes, including almost rigid bodies consisting of N
molecules]
|
| T
= <K,I> |
A theory-element (the smallest unit to be regarded
as a theory) |
 |
The specialization relation between theory-elements
[T could be a specialization of similar
theory-elements with more general force laws, e.g., including
friction and/or time-dependent external forces. One could also
imagine more abstract force laws which fix only some general
properties such as “action=reaction”. T in turn
could be specialized to theory-elements of systems with equal masses
and/or equal spring constants. ] |
| N |
A theory-net (a set of theory-elements ordered by
-- the “typical” notion of a theory)
[An obvious theory-net containing our example of a
theory-element is CPM = “classical particle mechanics”,
conceived as a network of theory-elements essentially ordered by the
degree of generality of its force laws.] |
| E |
A theory-evolution (a theory-net “moving”
through historical time)
[Special interesting new force laws could be
discovered in the course of time, e.g., the Toda chain in 1967, as
well as new applications of known laws.] |
| H |
A theory-holon (a complex of theory-nets tied by
“essential” links)
[It is difficult to think of examples which are
smaller than H = all physical theory-nets. ] |
Günther Ludwig is a German physicist mainly known for his work
on the foundations of quantum theory. In Ludwig (1970, 1985, 1987),
he published an axiomatic account of quantum mechanics, which was
based on the statistical interpretation of quantum theory. As a
prerequisite for this work he found it necessary to ask “What is
a physical theory?” and developed a general concept of a theory
on the first 80 pages of his (1970). Later this general theory was
expanded into the book Ludwig (1978). A recent elaboration of
Ludwig's program can be found in Schröter (1996).
His underlying “philosophy” is the view that there are real
structures in the world which are “pictured” or represented,
in an approximate fashion, by mathematical structures, symbolically
PT = W
()
MT. The mathematical theory MT
used in a physical theory PT contains as its core a
“species of structure”
.
This is a meta-mathematical concept of Bourbaki which Ludwig
introduced into the structuralistic approach. The contact between
MT to some “domain of reality”
W is achieved by a set of correspondence principles
(),
which give rules for translating physical facts into certain
mathematical statements called “observational
reports”. These facts are either directly observable or given by
means of other physical theories, called “pre-theories” of
PT. In this way a part G of
W, called “basic domain” is
constructed. But it remains a task of the theory to construct the
full domain of reality W, that is, the more complete
description of the basic domain that also uses
PT-theoretical terms.
Superficially considered, this concept of theory shows some
similarity to neo-positivistic ideas and would be subject to similar
criticism. For example, the discussion of the so-called
‘theory-laden’ character of observation sentences casts
doubts on such notions as “directly observable
facts”. Nevertheless, the adherents of the Ludwig approach would
probably argue for a moderate form of observationalism and would
point out that, within Ludwig's approach, the theory-laden character of
observation sentences could be analyzed in detail.
Another central idea of Ludwig's program is the description of
intra- and inter-theoretical approximations by means of “uniform
structures”, a mathematical concept lying between topological
and metrical structures. Although this idea was later adopted by the
other structuralistic programs, it plays a unique rôle within
Ludwig's meta-theory in connection with his finitism. He believes
that the mathematical structures of the infinitely large or small,
a priori, have no physical meaning at all; they are
preliminary tools to approximate finite physical reality. Uniform
structures are vehicles for expressing this particular kind of
approximation.
Generally speaking, Ludwig's program is, in comparison to those of
Sneed and Scheibe, less descriptive and more normative with respect
to physics. He developes an ideal of how physical theories should be
formulated rather than reconstructing the actual practice. The
principal worked-out example that comes close to this ideal is still
the axiomatic account of quantum mechanics, as described in Ludwig
(1985, 1987).
The German philosopher Erhard Scheibe has published several books and
numerous essays on various topics of philosophy of science; see, for
example, Scheibe (2001). He has often commented on the programs of
Sneed and Ludwig, such as in his “Comparison of two recent views
on theories”, reprinted in Scheibe (2001, 175-194). Moreover,
he published one of the earliest case studies of approximate theory
reduction; see Scheibe 2001 (306-323) for the 1973 case study.
In his recent books on “reduction of physical theories,”
Scheibe (1997, 1999) developed his own concept of theory, which to
some extent can be considered an intermediate position between those
of Ludwig and Sneed. For example, he conveniently combines the
model-theoretical and syntactical styles of Sneed and Ludwig,
respectively. Since his main concern is reduction, he does not need
to cover all the aspects of physical theories that are treated in the
other approaches. As already mentioned, he proposes a more flexible
concept of reduction that is open to extensions arising from new
case studies.
A unique feature of Scheibe's approach is the thorough discussion of
almost all the important cases of reduction considered in the physical
literature. These include classical vs. special-relativistic
spacetime, Newtonian gravitation vs. general relativity,
thermodynamics vs. kinetic theory, and classical vs. quantum
mechanics. He essentially arrives at the conclusion of a double
incompleteness: the attempts of the physicists to prove reduction
relations in the above cases are largely incomplete according to
their own standards, as well as according to the requirements of a
structuralistic concept of reduction. But this concept is also not
complete, Scheibe argues, since, for example, a satisfactory
understanding of “counter-factual” limiting processes such
as
0
or
c
has not yet been developed.
We have sketched three structuralistic programs which have been
developed in the past three decades in order to tackle problems in
philosophy of physics, some of which are relevant also for physics
itself. Any program which employs a weighty formal apparatus in order
to describe a domain and to solve specific problems has to be
scrutinized with respect to the economy of its tools: to what extent
is this apparatus really necessary to achieve its goals? Or is it
concerned mainly with self-generated problems? We have tried to
provide some arguments and material for the reader who ultimately has
to answer these questions for him- or herself.
This bibliography is restricted to a selection of a few books wich
are of some importance for the three structuralistic programs. An
extended ‘Bibliography of Structuralism’ connected to
Sneed's program appeared in Erkenntnis 44
(1994). An analogous bibliography of articles and books pertaining to
Ludwig's program is in preparation. Unfortunately, the central books
of Ludwig (1978) and Scheibe (1997, 1999) are not yet translated into
English. For an introduction into the respective theories, English
readers could consult chapter XIII of Ludwig (1987) and chapter V of
Scheibe (2001).
Sneed's program
- Balzer, W., and Moulines, C. U., 1996, (eds.), Structuralist
theory of science, Focal Issues, New Results, Berlin: de Gruyter
- Balzer, W., and Moulines, C. U., Sneed, J. D., 1987,
An Architectonic for Science, Dordrecht: Reidel
- Sneed, J. D., 1971, The Logical Structure of Mathematical
Physics, Dordrecht: Reidel; (2nd ed. 1979)
- Stegmüller, W., 1979, `The Structuralist View: Survey,
Recent Developments and Answers to Some Criticisms', in The Logic
and Epistemology of Scientific Change, I. Niiniluoto and
R. Tuomela (eds.), Amsterdam: North Holland
Ludwig's program
- Bourbaki, N., 1986, Theory of Sets, Elements of
Mathematics, Paris: Hermann
- Ludwig, G., 1970, Deutung des Begriffs “physikalische
Theorie” und axiomatische Grundlegung der Hilbertraumstruktur
der Quantenmechanik durch Hauptsätze des Messens, Lecture
Notes in Physics 4, Berlin: Springer
- -----, 1978, Die Grundstrukturen einer physikalischen
Theorie, Berlin: Springer; 2nd ed. 1990; French translation by
G. Thurler: Les structures de base d'une théorie
physique
- -----, 1985, An Axiomatic Basis for Quantum Mechanics, Vol. 1,
Derivation of Hilbert Space Structure, Berlin: Springer
- -----, 1987, An Axiomatic Basis for Quantum Mechanics, Vol. 2,
Quantum Mechanics and Macrosystems, Berlin: Springer
- Schmidt, H.-J., 1979, Axiomatic Characterization of Physical
Geometry, Lecture Notes in Physics 111, Berlin:
Springer
- Schröter, J., 1996, Zur Meta-Theorie der Physik,
Berlin: de Gruyter
Scheibe's program
- Scheibe, E., 1997, Die Reduktion physikalischer Theorien,
Teil I, Grundlagen und elementare Theorie, Berlin: Springer
- -----, 1999, Die Reduktion physikalischer Theorien, Teil II,
Inkommensurabilität und Grenzfallreduktion, Berlin: Springer
- -----, 2001, Between Rationalism and Empiricism, Selected
Papers in the Philosophy of Physics, ed. by B. Falkenburg,
Berlin: Springer
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
model theory |
physics: experiment in |
physics: intertheory relations in |
quantum mechanics |
realism-scientific
Acknowledgment
The author is indebted to John D. Norton, Edward N. Zalta, and
Susanne Z. Riehemann for helpful suggestions concerning the content
and the language of this entry.
Copyright © 2002
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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy