Questions about the nature and existence of properties are nearly as
old as philosophy itself. Interest in properties has ebbed and flowed
over the centuries, but they are now undergoing a resurgence. The last
twenty five years have seen a great deal of interesting work on
properties, and this entry will focus primarily on that work (thus
taking up where Loux's (1972) earlier review of the literature leaves
off).
When we turn to the recent literature on properties we find a
confusing array of terminology, incompatible standards for evaluating
theories of properties, and philosophers talking past one another. It
will be easier to follow this literature if we begin by focusing on
the point of introducing properties in the first
place. Philosophers who argue that properties exist almost always do
so because they think properties are needed to solve certain
philosophical problems, and their views about the nature of
properties are strongly influenced by the problems they think
properties are needed to solve. So the discussion here will be
organized around the tasks properties have been introduced to perform
and the ways in which these tasks influence accounts of the nature of
properties.
In §1 I introduce some distinctions and terminology that will
be useful in subsequent discussion. The tasks properties are called
on to perform are typically explanatory, and so §2
contains a brief discussion of explanation in ontology. §3
contains a discussion of traditional attempts to use properties to
explain phenomena in metaphysics, epistemology, philosophy of
language, and ethics. §4 focuses on the three areas where
contemporary philosophers have offered the most detailed accounts
based on properties: philosophy of mathematics, the semantics of
natural languages, and topics in a more nebulous area that might be
called naturalistic ontology. We then turn to issues about
the nature of properties, including their existence conditions
(§5), their identity conditions (§6), and the various sorts
of properties there might be (§7). §8 provides an
introductory, informal discussion of formal theories of
properties. After §2 the sections, and in many cases the
subsections, are relatively modular, and readers can use the
detailed tables of contents
and hyperlinks to locate those topics that interest them most.
[Detailed Table of Contents (to subsection level)]
[More Detailed Table of Contents (to subsubsection level) ]
Properties include the attributes or qualities or features or
characteristics of things. Issues in ontology are so vexed that even
those philosophers who agree that properties exist often disagree
about which properties there are. This means that there are no
wholly uncontroversial examples of properties, but likely candidates
include the color and rest mass of the apple on my desk, as well (more
controversially) as the properties of being an apple and
being a desk. For generality we will also take properties to
include relations like being taller than and lying
between.
Universals and Particulars. A fundamental question about
properties--second only in importance to the question whether there
are any--is whether they are universals or particulars. To say that
properties are universals is to say that the selfsame property can be
instantiated by numerically distinct things. On this view it is
possible for two different apples to exemplify exactly the same
color, a single universal. The competing view is that properties are
just as much individuals or particulars as the things that have
them. No matter how similar the colors of the two apples, their
colors are numerically distinct properties, the redness of the first
apple and the redness of the second. Such individualized properties
are variously known as ‘perfect particulars’,
‘abstract particulars’, ‘quality instances’,
‘moments’, and ‘tropes’.
Tropes have various attractions and
liabilities, but since they are the topic of another entry, we will
construe properties (save for any, perhaps those like being
identical with Socrates, that could only be exemplified by one
thing) as universals.
Properties and Relations. Properties are sometimes
distinguished from relations. For example, a specific shade of red or
a rest mass of 3 kilograms is a property, while being smaller
than or having a weight of 29.4 newtons are typically
regarded as relations (both of which relate my laptop computer to the
Earth). Relations generate a few special
problems of their own, but for the most part properties and relations
raise the same philosophical issues and, except where otherwise noted,
I will use ‘property’ as a generic term to cover both monadic
(one-place, nonrelational) properties and (polyadic, multi-place)
relations.
Properties can be Instantiated. Properties are most naturally
contrasted with particulars, i.e., with individual things. The
fundamental difference between properties and individuals is that
properties can be instantiated or exemplified, whereas
individuals cannot. Furthermore, at least many properties are
general; they can be instantiated by more than one thing.
The things that exemplify a property are called instances of
it (the instances of a relation are the things, taken in the relevant
order, that stand in that relation). It is a matter of controversy
whether properties can exist without actually being exemplified and
whether some properties can be exemplified by other properties (in the
way, perhaps, that redness exemplifies the property of being
a color). Some philosophers even hold that there are
unexemplifiable properties, e.g., being red and not red, but
even they typically believe that such properties are intimately
related to other properties (here being red and not being
red) that can be exemplified.
Realism, Nominalism, and Conceptualism. The deepest question
about properties is whether there are any. Textbooks feature a
triumvirate of answers: realism, nominalism, and
conceptualism. There are many species of each view, but the
rough distinctions come to this. Realists hold that there are
universal properties. Nominalists deny this (though some hold that
there are tropes). And conceptualists urge that words (like
‘honesty’) which might seem to refer to properties really refer to
concepts. A few contemporary philosophers have defended conceptualism
(cf. Cocchiarella, 1986, ch. 3), and recent empirical work on concepts
bears on it. It is not a common view nowadays, however, and I will
focus on realism here.
The Revival of Properties. Just a few decades ago many
philosophers concurred with Quine's dismissal of properties as
"creatures of darkness," but philosophers now widely invoke them
without guilt or shame. For example, most current discussions of
mental causation are couched in terms of the causal efficacy of mental
properties, while discussions of supervenience often proceed by way of
a claim that one family of properties (e.g., mental properties) is
supervenient on some other family of properties (e.g., physical
properties). But the resurgence of interest in properties has left us
with widely varying accounts of their nature, and questions about
their existence have by no means disappeared.
Properties are as Properties Do. It is possible to classify
theories of properties in terms of their characterizations of the
nature of properties or in terms of the jobs they
introduce properties to do. The former kind of characterization is
more fundamental, but since views about the nature of properties are
typically motivated by accounts of the work properties are invoked to
do, it will be more useful to begin with the latter. We will ask what
explanatory roles properties have been introduced to fill, and
we will then try to determine what something would have to be
like in order to occupy those roles. This will also allow us
to consider the sorts of arguments that are typically advanced for the
claim that properties exist.
Philosophers do not have a settled idiom for talking about
properties. Often they make do with a simple distinction between
singular terms and predicates. Singular terms are words and phrases
(like proper names and definite descriptions) that can occupy subject
positions in sentences and that purport to denote or refer to a
single thing. Examples include ‘Bill Clinton,’
‘Chicago’, and ‘The first female Supreme Court
Justice’. Predicates, by contrast, can be true of things. When
we represent a sentence like ‘Quine is a philosopher’ in a
standard formal language (like first-order logic) as
‘Pq’, we absorb the entire expression ‘is a
philosopher’ into the predicate ‘P’ (though for
some theoretical purposes it is more useful to count
‘philosopher’ or even ‘a philosopher’ as the
predicate). The notion of a predicate is supplanted by the notion of
a verb phrase in modern grammars, so we don't need to pursue
this issue here, but we can raise our first question about property
talk at this relatively atheoretical level.
It is perfectly grammatical to say ‘Monica is honest’ or
‘Honesty is a virtue’, but your old English teacher will
cringe if you say ‘Honest is a virtue’ or ‘Monica is
honesty’. We must use ‘honest’ after the ‘Monica
is’, and we have to use the nominalization, ‘honesty’,
before ‘is a virtue’. The fact that ‘honest’ and
‘honesty’ cannot be interchanged without destroying the
grammaticality of our original sentences has been thought to have
various philosophical morals. Some philosophers take it to show that
the two expressions cannot stand for the same thing; for example,
‘honest’ might stand for a property and ‘honesty’
might stand for a property-correlate of some sort (Frege draws
roughly this moral from his discussion of ‘the concept
horse’). Others take it to show that although both expressions
are related to the same thing, the property honesty, they are
related to by different semantic relations; for example, the
nominalization denotes this property, whereas the predicate expresses
it.
Frege's argument for the first sort of view is not compelling
(see Parsons, 1986, for a good discussion); moreover, it would be
desirable to avoid multiplying entities (e.g., property correlates)
and semantic relations (e.g., expression) beyond necessity. And mere
failures of substitutivity are not enough to show that they are
necessary, since various syntactic features of sentences prohibit the
exchange of terms that are clearly co-referential. Consider case
forms of personal pronouns: ‘I’ and ‘me’ cannot
be exchanged (without destroying grammaticality) in sentences like
‘I dropped the hammer, and he returned it to
me’. But no one concludes that distinct objects (me and a
me-correlate) or distinct semantic relations (nominative-case
reference and accusative-case reference) are needed to account for
this.
The multiplicity of ways of talking about properties can be obscured
when we use familiar formal languages to represent them. The
constructions verb (‘lives’), verb + adverb (‘sings
badly’), copula + adjective (‘is red’), copula +
determiner + common noun (‘is a dog’), copula + noun phrase
(‘is a Republican President), and (if Davidson's account of
events is correct) even adverbs (‘slowly’) and
prepositional phrases (‘in the bathroom’) all go over into
the familiar ‘F’s and ‘G’s of
standard logical notation. The fact that these expressions can often
be handled in the same way without too much violence tells us that
they have certain similarities, but there are also many differences,
and some of them may turn out to be relevant to ontology.
The complexities involving property words are even greater when we
turn to singular terms. We can form singular terms from predicative
expressions in many ways (different ways are appropriate for
different predicates). To begin with, English contains a plethora of
suffixes that we can append to predicative expressions
(sometimes after minor surgery on the original) to form singular
terms. These include ‘-hood’ (‘motherhood,
‘falsehood), ‘-ness’ (‘drunkeness’,
‘betweeness’), ‘-ity’ (‘triangularity’,
‘solubility’, ‘stupidity’), ‘-kind’
(‘mankind’), ‘-ship’ (‘friendship’,
‘brinksmanship’), ‘ing’ (‘walking’,
‘loving’), ‘ment’ (‘commitment’,
‘judgment’), ‘cy’ (‘decency’,
‘leniency’), and more.
Various philosophical terms of art serve a similar purpose. The word
‘itself’ plays this role in some translations of Plato (‘The equal
itself’, ‘Justice itself’), and contemporary authors use phrases like
‘the property red’, ‘the property of being red’, and ‘the causal
relation’ to much the same end. Various gerundive phrases (e.g.,
‘being red’ and ‘being a red thing’) and infinitive phrases (‘to be
happy’, ‘to be someone who is happy’) work in a similar way. Finally,
there are many less systematic ways of talking about properties; for
example, we can use a definite description that a property just
happens to satisfy (‘the color of my true love's hair’, ‘John's
favorite four-place relation’).
The expressions formed in these ways occupy subject positions in
sentences where they seem to denote to properties. It is worth
noting, however, that it is often impossible to substitute some of
these expressions for related ones without destroying the
grammaticality or, in some cases, without altering the truth value of
the original sentence. Consider ‘wisdom’, ‘being wise’, ‘the property
of being wise’, and ‘to be wise’. ‘Wisdom is a virtue’ is
unexceptionable, but ‘Being wise is a virtue’ is shaky at best. On
the other hand, ‘To be wise is to be virtuous’ and ‘Being wise is a
good thing’ are fine, but ‘Wisdom is to be virtuous’ clearly won't
do. And ‘The property of being wise is a good thing’ is grammatical,
but has a different meaning from ‘Being wise is a good thing’.
The phenomenon of case shows that lack of substitutivity alone
doesn't have deep ontological consequences, but it is quite possible
that the sorts of phenomena noted in the previous paragraph signal
important differences in ontology. Some of these differences might
begin to emerge from informal probing, but we cannot expect to settle
such matters without detailed, philosophically-sensitive syntactic and
semantic theories that are better supported than their rivals. Such
theories do not yet exist, and so here I will be fairly cavalier about
"property terms," using various phrases, e.g., ‘redness’ and ‘the
property of being red’ indifferently to refer to the same
property. But this expedient is not meant to suggest that subtle
grammatical differences won't eventually turn out to have important
ontological implications.
Properties are typically introduced to help explain or
account for phenomena of philosophical interest. The existence
of properties, we are told, would explain qualitative recurrence or
help account for our ability to agree about the instances of general
terms like ‘red’. In the terminologies of bygone eras, properties save
the phenomena; they afford a fundamentum in re for things like
the applicability of general terms. Nowadays philosophers make a
similar point when they argue that some phenomenon holds because
of or in virtue of this or that property, that a property
is its foundation or ground for it, or that a property
is the truth maker for a sentence about it. These expressions
signify explanations.
When properties are introduced to help explain certain
philosophically puzzling phenomena, we have a principled way to learn
what properties are like: since they are invoked to play
certain explanatory roles, we can ask what they would
have to be like in order to play the roles they are introduced
to fill. What, for example, would their existence or identity
conditions need to be for them to explain the (putative) modal
features of natural laws or the a priori status of mathematical
truths?
Perhaps the deepest question in ontology is when (if ever) it is
legitimate to postulate the existence of entities (like possible
worlds, facts, or properties) that are not evident in experience.
Some philosophers insist that it never is. Others urge that at least
some entities of this sort, in particular properties, have no
explanatory power and that appeals to them are vacuous or otherwise
illegitimate (e.g., Quine, 1961, p. 10; Quinton 1973, p. 295).
The more heavy-handed dismissals of properties and other metaphysical
creatures have often been based on faulty accounts of concept
formation (which led Hume to counsel consignment of metaphysical works
to the flames) or defective theories of meaning (which led many
positivists to view metaphysics as a series of pseudo explanations
offered to solve pseudo problems). Wittgenstein takes a more subtle
approach, trying to show us that ‘our disease is one of wanting
explanations’ (1991, Pt VI, 31) and striving to cure us of it. Swoyer
(1999) has attempted some defense of explanation by postulation in
ontology, but the issues are difficult ones that are not amenable to
proof or disproof. Fortunately the present task is not to defend
explanation in ontology, but it will be useful to briefly note two
general views about such explanations.
Metaphysics has traditionally been viewed as first philosophy, and
some philosophers hold that its arguments should be demonstrative.
Recently Linsky & Zalta (1995) have argued that it is possible to
give a transcendental argument for the existence of properties; if
this argument is successful, it is demonstrative, and they claim that
its conclusion (that a wide range of properties exist) is synthetic
a priori. Others (e.g., Swoyer, 1983; 1999) urge that most of
the arguments advanced on behalf of properties appear anemic when
judged by the demonstrative ideal, but that they look much better when
viewed as inferences to the best explanations. We will not pursue this
issue, however, since it is impossible to form a satisfactory view
about the nature of philosophical explanations in a vacuum. An account
of metaphysical explanation should instead emerge from a consideration
of the more plausible metaphysical explanations, and we will focus on
such explanations here.
Philosophical explanations are usually thought to be constrained in
various ways, but beyond philosophical family values like consistency,
parsimony and comprehensiveness these constraints will often seem
parochial to those philosophers who are not committed to them. In
Medieval disputations about universals, for example, religion and
theology were fundamental, and it was widely held that any account of
properties should be able to explain the Trinity, the Eucharist, and
the absolutely unchanging nature of God (this last requirement often
led to quite tortured accounts of the relations holding between
protean finite beings and God). But few philosophers in our
naturalistic era would give such considerations a second thought.
Some proposed constraints on metaphysical explanation depend on more
general philosophical orientations. For example, Russell's Principle
of Acquaintance, the injunction that we only admit items into our
ontology if we are directly acquainted with them, expresses an strong
empiricist sentiment. Other constraints are more directly
metaphysical. For example, Aristotle upbraids Plato for separating
the Forms from their instances, suggesting that this renders them
incapable of explaining anything (e.g.,
Metaphysics,1079b11--1080a10). His point seems to be that
properties could explain things about individuals only if they were
located in those individuals. The sentiment is that an
individual, spatio-temporal object (like my cat) which stands in some
obscure relation to some entity entirely outside of space and time
(say the Form of the cat) cannot explain anything about the cat
itself.
All accounts of properties must avoid various perennial objections to
them. Three criticisms of this sort were anticipated by Plato
(worrying about his own doctrines) in the Parmenides.
First, it appears that a universal property can be in two completely
different places (i.e., in two different instances) at the same time,
but ordinary things can never be separated from themselves in this
way. There are scattered individuals (like the former British Empire),
but they have different spatial parts in different places. Properties,
by contrast, do not seem to have spatial parts; indeed, they are
sometimes said to be wholly-present in each of their instances. But
how could a single thing be wholly present in widely separated
locations?
This conundrum has worried some philosophers so much that they have
opted for an ontology of tropes in order to avoid it, but realists
have two lines of reply (both of which commit us to fairly definite
views about the nature of properties). One response is that properties
are not located in their instances (or anywhere else), so they are
never located in two places at once. The other response is that this
objection wrongly judges properties by standards that are only
appropriate for individuals. Properties are a very different sort of
entity, and they can exist in more than one place at the same
time without needing spatial parts to do so.
Second, some properties seem to exemplify themselves. For example, if
properties are abstract objects, then the property of being abstract
should itself exemplify the property of being abstract. In various
passages throughout his dialogues Plato appears to hold that Forms
(which are often taken to be his version of properties) participate in
themselves. Indeed, this claim serves as a premise in what is known as
his Third-Man Argument which, he seems to think, may show that
the very notion of a Form is incoherent (Parmenides, 132ff).
Russell's paradox raises more serious
worries about self-exemplification. It shows that any account which
allows properties to exemplify themselves must be carefully formulated
if it is to avoid paradox (a polite word for inconsistency).
Third, many critics have charged that properties generate vicious
regresses, e.g., the one exhibited in Plato's third man argument or
Bradley's regress, and any viable account
of properties must have the resources to avoid them.
The disputes about plausible constraints on property-invoking
explanations, together with the obvious difficulty of settling such
disputes, leave the situation murkier than we would wish. We will see
that the use of properties to explain phenomena in the philosophy of
mathematics or naturalistic ontology or the semantics of natural
languages imposes additional, tighter, constraints that make it easier
to evaluate competing accounts. But constraints of the sort noted here
have played a central role in many philosophical discussions of
properties, and we will often fail to understand those discussions if
we forget this.
Metaphysics, like life, is full of tradeoffs, cost-benefit analyses,
the attempt to simultaneously satisfy competing constraints. In
ontology we must frequently weigh tradeoffs between various
desiderata, e.g., between simplicity and comprehensiveness, and even
between different kinds of simplicity. But one tradeoff is so
pervasive that it deserves a name, and I will call it the
fundamental ontological tradeoff. The fundamental ontological
tradeoff reflects the perennial tension between explanatory power and
epistemic risk, between a rich, lavish ontology that promises to
explain a great deal and a more modest ontology that promises
epistemological security. The more machinery we postulate, the more
we might hope to explain--but the harder it is to believe in the
existence of all the machinery.
The dialectic between a realism with chutzpah and a diffident
empiricism runs all through philosophy, from ethics to philosophy of
science to philosophy of mathematics to metaphysics. Excessive
versions of each view are usually unappealing. Extreme realists ask us
to believe in things many philosophers find it difficult to believe
in; extreme empiricists wind up unable to explain much of
anything. But the dialectic between power and risk remains even when
we move in from the extremes. It often manifests itself in a yearning
for parsimony, a desire for as few entities as we can scrimp by with.
Such longings may seem prudish or stuffy or a bit too metaphysically
correct. Often the desire is not to achieve parsimony for its own
sake, however, but to find an ontology that is modest enough to
provide a measure of epistemological security. Choices needn't be all
or none, and a principled middle ground is always worth striving for.
But no matter where a philosopher tries to stake her claim, the
fundamental ontological tradeoff can rarely be avoided and we will
encounter it frequently in what follows.
Properties have been invoked to explain a very wide range of
phenomena. The things to be explained (explananda; singular
explanandum) are a mixed bag, and the explanations vary greatly
in plausibility. To fix ideas, we will note several of the most common
explanations philosophers have asked properties to provide (for a
longer list see Swoyer, 1999, §3).
There are objective similarities or groupings in the world. Some
things are alike in certain ways. They have the same color or shape or
size; they are protons or lemons or central processing units. A
puzzle, sometimes called the problem of the One over the Many,
asks for an account of this. Possession of a common property (e.g., a
given shade of yellow) or a common constellation of properties (e.g.,
those essential to lemons) has often been cited to explain such
resemblance. Similarly, different groups of things, e.g., Bill and
Hillary, George and Barbara, can be related in similar ways, and the
postulation of a relation (here being married to) that each
pair jointly instantiates is often cited to explain this
similarity. Finally, having different properties, e.g., different
colors, is often said to explain qualitative differences. A desire to
explain qualitative similarity and qualitative difference has been a
traditional motivation for realism with respect to universals, and it
continues to motivate many realists today (e.g., Armstrong, 1984, p
250; Butchvarov, 1966; Aaron, 1967, ch. 9).
Many organisms easily recognize and classify newly encountered
objects as yellow or round or lemons or rocks, they can recognize that
one new thing is larger than a second, and so on. Some philosophers
have urged that this ability is based partly on the fact that the
novel instances have a property that the organism has encountered
before--the old and new cases share a common property--and that the
creature is somehow attuned to recognize it.
Our ability to use general terms (like ‘yellow, ‘lemon’, ‘heavier
than’, ‘between’) provides a linguistic counterpart to the
epistemological phenomenon of recognition and to the metaphysical
problem of the One over the Many. Most general terms apply to some
things but not to others, and in many cases competent speakers have
little trouble knowing when they apply and when they do not.
Philosophers have often argued that possession of a common property
(like redness), together with certain linguistic conventions,
explains why general terms apply to the things that they do. For
example Plato noted that ‘we are in the habit of postulating one
unique Form for each plurality of objects to which we apply a common
name’ (Republic, 596A; see also Phaedo 78e,
Timaeus, 52a, Parmenides, 13; Russell, Problems of
Philosophy, p. 93). Questions about the meanings (now often known
as the ‘semantic values’) of singular terms like ‘honesty’ and
‘hunger’ and ‘being in love’ may be even more pressing, since the
chief task of such terms seems to be to refer to things. But
what could a word like ‘honesty’ refer to? If there are properties,
it could refer to the property honesty.
In a brilliant paper on Plato's theory of Forms (which, as noted
above, are often taken to be his version of properties), the
classicist H. F. Cherniss (1936) argues that Plato intended his theory
to solve three fundamental philosophical problems. By the end of the
fifth century B.C. the arguments and conundrums of philosophers had
cast doubt on several things that Plato thought were obviously true.
In ethics Protagorean relativism threatened the view that ethical
principles could be objective; in the clamor of individual
disagreements, clashes between cultures, and the failure of
philosophical inquiry to locate any firm ground, the challenge was to
explain how ethical objectivity was possible. When Plato turned
to epistemology, various considerations convinced him that there was
an important difference between knowledge (episteme) and belief
(doxa), even between knowledge and true belief (right
opinion). But how could we explain that? Finally, in metaphysics it
seemed clear that things change in various ways, but the arguments of
Parmenides made even this seem mysterious.
Plato drew on his Forms to explain how these three phenomena were
possible. On his view, the Forms exist pure and unadulterated by
human thought, and some Forms, most prominently the Good, offer
objective standards for values like goodness and justice. In
epistemology Plato attempted to explain the difference between
knowledge and belief by arguing that Forms are the objects of the
former but not the latter (e.g., Timaeus, 51d3ff). In
metaphysics Plato argued that change is only possible against a
background of things that do not change, and he urged that the Forms
provided this (Cratylus, 439d3ff). Finally, although Cherniss
doesn't mention it, Plato's theory of Forms helped explain the
semantics of general terms (as suggested in Republic, 596A).
This isn't to say that all, or indeed any, of Plato's explanations
were successful. But it is worth noting that many philosophers still
invoke properties to account for the sorts of things Plato struggled
to explain. Early in this century G. E. Moore offered an alternative
to ethical naturalism by claiming that goodness is a simple,
non-natural property. Few contemporary philosophers would accept
Moore's anti-naturalism or his account of non-natural properties, but
many would defend ethical naturalism by arguing that moral properties
supervene on naturalistically respectable properties.
Virtually no philosophers accept Plato's account of the difference
between knowledge and belief, but many still hold that properties have
an important role to play in explaining epistemological phenomena.
For example, Russell (1912, ch. 10) argued that the only way to
explain the possibility of a priori knowledge is to regard it
as knowledge of relations among universals . Most philosophers today
would question this, but many of them would agree that properties have
an important role to play in explaining such epistemological phenomena
as our ability to recognize and categorize things in the world around
us.
Few contemporary philosophers would endorse Plato's claims about the
need for some permanent backdrop for flux, but properties can still be
cited to explain change. If my pet chameleon was brown all over
yesterday and is green all over today, then the brute existence of the
creature isn't enough to explain the change; after all, he
persisted throughout. But, some philosophers urge, we can explain the
alteration by noting that the chameleon exemplified the property
brownness yesterday but he exemplifies the property
greenness today.
Finally, many philosophers would concur that Plato's account of the
meanings of general terms was on the right track, though as we shall
see in §4.2, current accounts of meaning
have moved far beyond Plato's in their detail and formal
sophistication.
This brief survey of putative explanations that rely on properties
isn't meant to be detailed or exhaustive; the point is simply to
illustrate how a range of accounts employ properties in an effort to
explain philosophically puzzling phenomena. Just as importantly,
Plato's account suggests an attractive model for philosophical
explanation. A general pattern of explanation by unification,
integration or systematization is at work in his attempt
to solve three, superficially disparate, problems using the same
resources. He attempts to show that at a fundamental level the three
phenomena are related, linked by the Forms and the principles than
govern them. This unification has explanatory value, since it allows
us to see a single pattern or entity at work in a range of
superficially diverse cases. At all events, this is one explanatory
virtue in the natural sciences, clearly at work in the work of Newton
and Maxwell and Darwin, and it is also a pattern we find in Plato's
account.
An account that employs properties to do multiple tasks has two
further virtues. First, insofar as each of the explanations is
plausible, it serves as part of a cumulative case for the
existence of properties. Second, if properties can perform multiple
tasks, they must simultaneously satisfy multiple constraints, and so
different sorts of data can be used to test a theory of
properties. The hope is that by considering several tasks of this sort
we could begin to triangulate in on the nature of properties; we could
begin to see what features properties would need to have in order to
play each of the different explanatory roles.
It may turn out, of course, that entities well-suited to one
explanatory role will be ill-suited to another. For example, we will
see below that the existence and identity conditions of entities used
to account for causation may be rather different from those needed by
entities that could serve as the meanings of intentional idioms (like
‘is thinking of Vienna’). This might lead us to postulate the
existence of several kinds of properties; alternatively, it might lead
us to conclude that properties cannot do all of the things
philosophers has hoped that they could. Either way, as fragmentation
increases, cumulative support and triangulation on the nature of
properties will slip away.
Properties alone cannot explain much of anything. A theory of
properties--an account that tells us what properties are like
and how they do what they are invoked to do--is required for
that. A number of theories of properties have been developed over the
last quarter century, and many of them possess much more depth,
sophistication, and formal detail than the no-frills accounts alluded
to in the previous section. I will focus on explanations in three
areas where properties are often invoked today: philosophy of
mathematics, semantics (the theory of meaning), and naturalistic
ontology. These areas are also useful to consider, because if
properties can explain things of interest to philosophers who don't
specialize in metaphysics, things like mathematical truth or the
nature of natural laws, then properties will seem more interesting.
Unlike the substantial forms derided by early modern philosophers as
dormitive virtues, properties will pay their way by doing interesting
and important work.
My aim is to indicate the general lay of the land and point the way
to more detailed discussions that interested readers can follow up.
In each of the three cases I will indicate:
- What is to be explained. As with most things in
philosophy, there is often some controversy over which things in a
given area stand in need of philosophical explanation. In some cases a
few philosophers question the very existence of the things that other
philosophers think require explanation; for example, able philosophers
have denied that there are such things as mathematical truth (e.g.,
Field, 1980) or laws of nature (e.g., van Fraassen, 1989). And even
those philosophers who think that we need to explain certain things,
e.g., various features of mathematical truth, may disagree about
precisely what those features are. In the three areas examined in
this section, however, there is a reasonable degree of consensus about
which things stand in need of explanation, and I will focus on these.
- How properties explain. In some cases different
philosophers use properties in different ways to explain the same
phenomenon. I will focus on the simpler, more common approaches. We
will also see that in most cases a theory of properties only explains
things when it is conjoined with various background assumptions or
auxiliary hypotheses.
- Beating the competition. Arguments that properties exist
because they explain some particular phenomenon (like qualitative
recurrence or mathematical truth) are weak if other sorts of entities
can account for it just as well. Arguments that alternative accounts
don't work, especially when they involve alternative putative entities
(like sets or tropes), are typically based on the claim that these
entities lack the requisite features to account for the explanandum. I
will also note a few cases where proponents of one account of
properties argue against proponents of a rival account, since these
arguments typically involve disputes over the nature of properties.
- Difficulties. Almost all explanations that employ
properties face difficulties, and I will briefly indicate the most
serious of these.
- Lessons the explanations teach us about properties.
Properties often must have certain features in order to provide
certain explanations. So once we have examined a given explanation, we
will ask what properties would have to be like in order to
provide it. In particular, we will ask what lessons are to be learned
about the existence and identity conditions of properties, their
structure (if any), and their modal and epistemic status.
Philosophers of mathematics have focused much (arguably too much) of
their attention on number theory (arithmetic). Number theory is just
the theory of the natural numbers, 0, 1, 2, ..., and the familiar
operations (like addition and multiplication) on them. Many sentences
of arithmetic, e.g., ‘7 + 5 = 12’ certainly seem to be true, but such
truths present various philosophical puzzles and philosophers have
tried to explain how they could have the features they seem to
have.
Most wish lists include hopes for explanations of at least five
(putative) facts; philosophers want to know:
- How the sentences of arithmetic can have truth values (how they
can be true or false)
- How the sentences of arithmetic can be objectively true (or
false), independently of human language and thought
- What the logical forms of the sentences of arithmetic are
- How the sentences of arithmetic can be necessarily true (or
necessarily false)
- How the truth values of sentences of arithmetic can be known
independently of experience (a priori), save for a modicum of
experience needed to acquire mathematical concepts
Most attempts to use properties to explain the items on this list are
versions of identificationism, the reductionist strategy that
identifies numbers with things that initially seem to be
different. This approach is familiar from the original versions of
identificationism where numbers were identified with sets, but it is
straightforward to adapt this earlier work to identify numbers with
properties rather than with sets.
Sets are often contrasted with properties, and before proceeding it
is important to note a fundamental difference between the two. If
x and y are sets and have exactly the same members, then
x and y are one and the same set. When x and
y have precisely the same members they are said to have the
same extension, and sets are often called extensional
entities. Just as sets can have members, properties can have
instances, things that exemplify or instantiate them, and this
relation of exemplification is to properties what the membership
relation is to sets.
The identity conditions of properties are a matter of
dispute. Everyone who believes there are properties at all, however,
agrees that numerically distinct properties can have exactly
the same instances without being identical. Even if it turns out that
exactly the same things exemplify a given shade of green and
circularity, these two properties are still distinct. For this reason
properties are often said to be intensional entities, although
people often concur with this because they agree about what
properties' identity conditions are not (they aren't
extensional), rather than because they agree about what their identity
conditions are.
If we have a rich enough theory of properties, it is possible to
retrace the steps of earlier versions of identificationism using
properties in place of sets. The property theorist can formulate
axioms for property theory that parallel the axioms of standard set
theories (save for replacing the axiom of extensionality with some
other identity condition, perhaps omitting the axiom of foundations,
and making other minor emendations to adapt the ideas better to
properties; e.g., Jubien, 1989; cf. Bealer, 1982, Ch. 6; Pollard and
Martin, 1986).
There are infinitely many natural numbers (the collection of natural
numbers in fact has the smallest size an infinite collection can
have), so the first step in identificationist programs is to find (or
postulate, or imagine) an infinite realm of properties. The next step
is to identify one denizen of this realm with the number zero and to
identify some operation on this realm of entities with the successor
function. The key here is that successive iterations of the function
yield a new and different entity every time it's applied.
There are two major species of identificationism. The first views
the reducing theory (of sets, or of properties) as a branch of logic;
the second views it as a substantive theory (of sets, or of
properties) that makes commitments over and above those made by
logic. There are important differences between the two approaches,
but given the very strong nature of the logic required for logicist
identificationism, the differences do not matter greatly here so I
will treat both approaches together. (For a discussion of the
differences, see Section 1 ("Logicist Identificationism") of the
supplementary document
Uses of Properties in the Philosophy of Mathematics.)
Identificationist accounts treat ‘1’ and ‘2’ as
singular terms that refer to properties (those properties that are
identified as the numbers 1 and 2), and they treat predicates and
function symbols as denoting relations and functions. Thus, since the
semantics values of ‘1’ and ‘2’ are in the
extension of the relation expressed by the predicate
‘<’, the sentence ‘1 < 2’ is true and,
indeed, it has the simple logical form of a predication of a
two-place predicate, ‘<’, with two singular terms,
‘1’ and ‘2’, i.e., it has the simple logical form
Rxy. We apply this idea to all atomic sentences in the
language of arithmetic and then extend the account to all sentences
in this language by the usual recursive treatments of the logical
constants.
This explains how sentences of arithmetic can be objectively true
(wishes 1 and 2): they are true because they describe an objective
realm of mind-independent properties. And since the language we use
has a straightforward referential semantics, it also supplies a very
natural and straightforward account of the logical forms of the
sentences of number theory (wish 3). Finally, if the properties
identified with numbers are ones that exist necessarily, and if they
necessarily stand in the arithmetical relations that they do, the
truths of arithmetic will be necessarily true (wish 4). But taken
alone property-based identificationism does not explain mathematical
knowledge (wish 5; we will return to this matter
below).
Some recent accounts identify numbers with properties that seem less
other-worldly than those invoked by mainstream identificationists. For
example, Bigelow and Pargetter (1990) argue that rational numbers are
higher-order relations--ratios--among certain kinds of
first-order relations. The leading idea is that if Bill is twice as
tall as Sam, then Bill stands in the relation twice as tall to
Sam. This relation in turn stands in the (second-order) ratio
relation of 2:1 to the identity relation among objects. Such
higher-order ratio relations are isomorphic to the rational numbers,
and Bigelow and Pargetter go on to identify them with the
rational numbers. Thus, the second-order relation 5:1 turns out to be
the number five. It isn't clear how to extend the ideas to large
infinite cardinals or to ordinal numbers, but they propose extending
the idea to second-order relations of proportion, and identifying the
reals with such proportions.
There are also several non-identificationist accounts of mathematical
truth that make use of properties.
The most important features, perhaps the only features, of the
natural numbers are structural ones. These are the features that
axiomatizations capture (zero is the first member of a countably
infinite sequence, each member of the sequence has exactly one member
that follows it, etc.). Such sequences are said to be omega-sequences.
Structuralists (often inspired by Benacerraf, 1965) take this idea to
heart and argue that any omega-sequence can play the role of the
natural numbers (cf. Resnik, 1995). They claim that it's the
structure that such sequences have in common, rather than the
particular entities that happen to populate them, that are important
for mathematics. And one way to develop this idea is to think of an
omega-sequence as a very complex, relational property that could be
instantiated by actual sequences of objects of the appropriate sort.
Structuralist accounts avoid one of the problems noted below (that of
isomorphic models) which besets all
versions of identificationism. They may also make the epistemology of
mathematics slightly less puzzling, since many structural or
pattern-like properties can be instantiated in the things we perceive
(we perceive such a property when we recognize a melody played in
different keys, for example). But they cannot deliver explanations of
the truth conditions and logical forms of arithmetical sentences that
are as straightforward as those provided by identificationist accounts
since they don't offer us any objects to serve as the referents of the
numerals.
Linsky and Zalta (1995) develop a novel account of mathematical
truth using Zalta's (1983) theory of abstract objects. (The
account is developed in much more detail in Zalta (2000) and (1999).)
It is relevant here because it is developed along side a formal
account of properties that rivals Bealer's in scope and detail.
Abstract objects are correlated with collections of properties (which
needn't be either maximal or consistent), situations are defined
as a special sort of abstract object, and mathematical theories are
identified with situations that encode only propositional
properties. The account is too detailed to present here, but we will
discuss Zalta's basic ideas
below when we turn to the identity conditions of
properties.
The most obvious competitors to property-based accounts of
mathematical truth identify numbers with sets, and as long as we focus
solely on mathematics, sets may seem more appealing. After all,
sets do have clearer identity conditions than properties. Moreover,
the iterative conception of sets, a picture according to which they
form a natural hierarchy, fits nicely with our picture of the
structure of natural numbers, whereas an iterative conception of
properties is less natural. Finally, set theory provides a powerful
unifying framework in which all sorts of mathematical entities, like
functions and spaces, can be reconstructed (or at least represented)
in a common idiom and dealt with by a common stock of techniques (like
proofs by mathematical induction).
The most compelling defense of the use of properties in the
philosophy of mathematics urges that when we step back and consider
the big picture we see that a rich enough stock of properties can do
all the work of sets (and numbers--or that we can use them to define
sets or numbers) and that properties can do further things that
sets simply cannot. For example, it has been argued that properties
can be used to give accounts of the semantics of English or explain
the nature of natural laws. The appeal of sets, in short, results from
a metaphysical myopia, but once we adopt a larger view of things we
find that properties provide the best global, overall explanation.
The gravest threats to identificationism are posed by what might be
called the Benacerraf problems. Authors who defend such
accounts are aware of these difficulties and have proposed various
responses to them, but the problems are serious and no solutions are
generally accepted.
As Benacerraf (1965) noted, if there is one way to identify the
natural numbers with sets, there are countless ways, e.g.,
Frege's, Zermelo's, von Neumann's, etc. (For a brief
discussion of this, see Section 2 ("Set-theoretic Identificationism")
of the supplementary document
Uses of Properties in the Philosophy of Mathematics.)
Some accounts are better for certain purposes than others. But no
account is best for all purposes, and if one was, no one has ever
explained how it would follow that it was the true story about
numbers.
There is a similar arbitrariness in any particular identification of
numbers with properties (as the fact that different property theorists
identify numbers with different properties shows). The point is most
obvious with those theories that treat properties as intensional
analogues of sets, since it is well-known that numbers can be
identified with sets in myriad ways. But it will be a problem for any
identificatory program, since there will be many isomorphic models of
number theory in the realm of properties (if it is commodious enough
to provide any models at all). And there is no reason for thinking
that any particular model gives The One True Story about what the
numbers actually are.
This difficulty also threatens less formal property-based accounts.
For example, there is some arbitrariness in Bigelow and Pargetter's
identifications, since we can find many different models of the theory
of rational numbers among the realm of ratio relations (e.g., we could
identify n/m with the relation n:m or with the relation
m:n), and there is no clear reason to suppose that one
identification is the right one.
The second problem, suggested by Benacerraf (1973) a few years later,
is that most versions of identificationism propose to identify numbers
with putative objects that lie outside the spatio-temporal, causal
order. The problem is that we are physical organisms living in a
spatio-temporal world who cannot interact causally (or in any other
discernible way) with abstract, causally inert things. Few people are
aware of having any special cognitive faculty that puts them in touch
with a timeless realm of abstract objects, neuroscientists have never
found any system in the brain that subserves such a capacity, such a
story is not suggested by what is known about the ways in which
children acquire numerical concepts, and nothing in physics remotely
suggests any way in which a physical system (the brain) can make any
sort of contact with causally inert, non-physical objects. None of
this proves that we don't have some sort of access to an abstract
realm of objects, but the claim that we do leaves the epistemology of
mathematics a mystery and, more importantly, there seems to be little
positive reason to suppose that it's true.
A few philosophers, e.g., Linsky & Zalta (1995) have taken the
problem of epistemic access seriously, and proposed solutions that do
not involve mysterious cognitive faculties. Philosophers remain
divided on this issue, but it is safe to say that if the problem of
epistemic access cannot be overcome, it in turn undermines
identificationist attempts to use properties to explain arithmetic
truth. If we cannot gain epistemic access to the realm of numbers,
then there is no clear way for us to establish connections between the
items of our language (e.g., ‘one’) and the numbers they denote. We
can't, for example, say that zero is the first number until we manage
to attach the word ‘number’ to the realm of numbers. It might seem
that we could avoid this difficulty by using purely structural
descriptions, ones employing only logical vocabulary, for the task.
If such descriptions were couched in a sufficiently powerful language
they could be used to characterize the natural numbers up to
isomorphism. Such a characterization is all we could ask of any
formalization, but it isn't enough to pick out the natural numbers
themselves, since if there is one model of a purely structural
sentence incorporating such a description, there will be many. For
example, such a sentence will have models in the domains of the
positive real numbers, the negative real numbers, many fragments of
the iterative hierarchy of sets, and so on.
Once again we face the fundamental ontological tradeoff: A richer
ontology offers to explain many things that might otherwise be
mysterious. But in the view of many philosophers, it engenders
epistemological mysteries of its own.
Identificationists sometimes speak of reducing numbers to
properties. Similarly, one might hope to reduce other things, e.g.,
possible worlds, to properties (e.g., Zalta, 1983, §4.2; Forrest,
1986). The aim is to show that they such things are nothing over and
above very complicated properties.
One of the most interesting reductionist programs attempts to reduce
individuals or particulars to collections of properties. Such programs
are often called bundle theories, since they identify ordinary
individuals with bundles of properties. Russell (1948, Pt. IV, ch. 8)
developed one account of this sort in which individuals were treated
as properties linked together by a relation he called
compresence. The evaluation of such accounts would require an
excursus into the ontology of individuals where issues like the
problem of individuation, the identity of indiscernibles, and identity
through time loom large. Such matters lie outside the scope of our
present discussion, though it is worth noting that they involve a
purer version of ontology than theories of properties; they have
relatively few implications outside of ontology itself.
What do property-based versions of identificationism tell us about
the nature of properties? We can read off minimum requirements
from the fact that in this domain sets can do most of the work that
properties are invoked to do.
Existence Conditions:
We require an infinite realm containing at least aleph-null (the
smallest infinite cardinal number) many properties. Depending on our
aspirations, we may need many more. For example, if we want to work
with huge transfinite cardinal numbers, we will need a very large
infinity of properties.
Identity Conditions:
Formalized mathematics is one of the few domains where extensionality
reigns, and the fact that sets can be used as surrogates of the
natural numbers tells us that entities with very coarse-grained
identity conditions can do at least most of the work of numbers.
Structure:
The realm of properties has to include enough relations among
properties to give it the structure of an omega-sequence. And if we
want to identify others sorts of numbers, e.g., the real, or complex,
or transfinite ordinal numbers, with properties, we will require many
additional properties as well as further relations to structure them
in the right sorts of ways.
Modal Status:
If the truths or arithmetic are necessarily true, then we need a
realm of necessarily existing properties that necessarily stand in the
(mathematically relevant) relations that they do.
Epistemic Status:
If the truths of arithmetic can be known a priori, then the
arithmetic features of those properties that play the role of numbers
must be knowable a priori.
Language and logic have long been an important source of data for
ontologists. Many philosophers have contented themselves with fairly
informal appeals to various features of language to support their
claim that properties exist, but in the last two decades some
philosophers (along with a few linguists and even computer scientists)
have employed properties as parts of detailed accounts of the
semantics (meaning) of large fragments of natural languages like
English or Choctaw, and some of these accounts contain the most
detailed formal theories of properties ever devised. Some property
theorists are motivated almost exclusively by a desire to give a
semantic account of natural language (e.g., Chierchia and Turner,
1988), others hold that this is but one of several motivations for
developing an account of properties (e.g., Bealer, 1982; Zalta, 1993),
but it should be noted that still others (e.g., Jubien, 1989;
Armstrong, 1997; cf. Mellor, 1986, pp. 180ff) doubt that properties
have any serious role to play in semantics at all.
Semantic accounts often go hand in hand with theories of logical
form. Logical form is a technical notion motivated by the
observation that sentences with a similar surface structure may
exhibit quite different logical behavior. For example, ‘John is tall
and Tom is tall’ entails ‘Tom is tall’, but ‘You show me someone who
dislikes John and I'll show you a real misanthrope’ does not entail
‘I'll show you a real misanthrope’. Furthermore, sentences that
appear different on the surface may exhibit similar logical
behavior. For example, ‘You show me someone who dislikes John and I'll
show you a real misanthrope’ and ‘If you show me someone who dislikes
John, then I'll show you a real misanthrope’ evince similar logical
behavior.
Such facts led various philosophers to introduce a theoretical notion
of logical form and to use it to provide theoretical redescriptions of
sentences in terms of their logical form in a way that allows us to
explain their logical features (e.g., why they are consistent with
some sentences but not with others or why they entail the sentences
they do). Although philosophers differ in how systematic they are in
developing such accounts, most arguments to the effect that properties
are needed to explain linguistic phenomena are linked to some
conception of logical form.
We will begin with four linguistic phenomena that might be explained
by a relatively informal and somewhat piecemeal account of properties.
- General terms like ‘blue’ and ‘honest’ can apply to a variety of
things, they apply to the things that they do partly because of their
meanings, and in some cases where two predicates in fact apply to
exactly the same things, they could have applied to different things.
- Abstract singular terms like ‘courage’ can occupy subject
position in true sentences (‘Courage is a virtue’), they seem to be
referring singular terms, and many of sentences of this sort (e.g.,
‘Courage is Tom's favorite virtue’) cannot be paraphrased in a way
that eliminates the abstract singular term.
- We can use pronouns (which certainly seem to be referring
expressions) that are anaphorically linked back to predicates
(‘Clinton is undisciplined, and that is a bad quality in a
president’) or to terms in subject position like gerunds (‘Being
undisciplined is deplorable, and it also endangers others’).
- Many sentences of English appear to quantify over the semantics
values of predicates (‘Clinton is tenacious, so there is at least one
virtue that he has’) or abstract singular terms (‘Lethargy is a
symptom of mononucleosis, so there is at least one symptom of that
malady’). And although some of these sentences can perhaps be
paraphrased or reconstrued in ways that dispel the appearance of
quantification, many have resisted years of such attempts. For
example, ‘There are some properties that will never be named’ cannot
be interpreted as an ontologically harmless substitutional
quantification. We can also count the things predicates or abstract
singular terms stand for (e.g., ‘There are exactly two symptoms that
mononucleosis and Barr-Epstein syndrome have in common’) and abstract
singular terms can flank the identity predicate (e.g., ‘I believe in
the unity of virtue: courage and temperance are the same thing’).
As long as we lack a precise mathematical characterization of
English, it isn't possible to prove that certain idioms cannot
be paraphrased away. But the use of abstract singular terms is so
common and the failures of attempts to paraphrase them away are so
clearcut that there is no reason to think that they could be
eliminated from English without eviscerating it.
A relatively unsophisticated account of properties can be mobilized
to explain the four phenomena listed above in a way that allows us to
use a relatively straightforward referential semantics with objectual
quantifiers. Such accounts explain the meanings of general terms (item
1) like ‘honest’ by claiming that they denote (or express) properties
(like honesty), that a sentence like ‘Tom is honest’ has the
logical form of a simple, subject-predicate sentence, and that it is
true just in case the individual denoted by ‘Tom’ is in the extension
of the property denoted (or expressed) by the predicate ‘honest’,
which requires that there be a property expressed by this predicate (a
slightly more formal account is given
below; see Hochberg, 1968, for a good
discussion of related issues).
In a similar spirit, some philosophers argue that abstract singular
terms like ‘honesty’ (item 2) denote the property that the
associated predicate (‘honest’) denotes or expresses, that sentences
like ‘Honesty is a virtue’ have the simple logical form of a
subject-predicate sentence, and that the sentence is true exactly when
the word ‘honesty’ denotes a property that is in the extension of the
property denoted by the verb phrase ‘is a virtue’.
Once we take these steps, it is also straightforward to explain the
remaining items on our list. For example the validity of the argument:
‘Clinton is self-indulgent; therefore, there is at least one vice that
Clinton has’ can be explained as follows: The logical form of the
premise is that a simple subject-predicate sentence and the logical
from of the conclusion is that of an existential quantification with a
standard objectual quantifier. If the first sentence is true, then
‘self-indulgent’ expresses a property, and this property satisfies the
open sentence ‘Clinton is X’. Hence, just as in standard first-order
logic, the existential quantification is true. Similar maneuvers
allows us to explain the remaining items on this list: if properties
are genuine things, then we can count them and we can use different
expressions to stand for the same property.
These explanations rely on little more than the following three
claims. First, there is a rich enough stock of properties to provide
a semantic value (meaning) for every predicate and abstract singular
term of English (or better, for all of those that could have such
semantic values without leading to paradox). Second, sentences like
‘Courage is a virtue’ and ‘John is courageous’ are simple
subject-predicate sentences. Third, such sentences are true just in
case the thing denoted by the subject is in the extension of the
property denoted (or expressed) by the predicate.
These simple assumptions account for the phenomena on our list in a
much better way than their more prominent rivals can. Some
philosophers, for example, hold that predicates have a multiple
denotation (multiply denoting all of the things to which they
apply). Others hold that the semantic values of predicates are sets
(the sets of things to which they apply). But these accounts cannot
explain the fact that many pairs of predicates that in fact have the
same extension (and hence the same multiple denotation‘) could
have applied to different groups of things and that their meanings are
precisely what allow them to do so. Even more seriously, these two
rivals have no plausible account at all of the last three items on the
list.
If the goal is simply to argue that there are properties because
there is no other way to explain several obvious linguistic and
logical phenomena (which is all many philosophers have aspired to
show), then the simple accounts sketched above make a plausible
(though certainly not unassailable) start. Some philosophers have set
their sights higher, however, wanting to provide a rigorous and
systematic account of the semantics of a large fragment of
English. They try to work the above ideas out in a more detailed way
and to extend them to deal with more complex phenomena, including the
following:
- Various English constructions are quite naturally interpreted as
complex predicates: ‘Tom is a boring but honest brother of Sam’ is
straightforwardly construed as a containing a compound predicate, ‘is
a boring but honest brother of Sam’ that is predicated of the noun
‘Tom’ (and that could be predicated of other nouns too, e.g.,
‘Wilbur’). Other constructions are very naturally interpreted as
complex singular terms (as in ‘Being a boring but honest brother of
Sam is no bed of roses’). Furthermore, these complex expressions are
related to simpler expressions in systematic ways. For example, ‘Tom
is a boring but not dishonest brother of Sam’ should entail ‘Tom is
not dishonest’.
- English is full of intensional idioms like ‘necessarily’,
‘believes’ and ‘imagines’ that cannot be handled by any extensional
semantics.
The simple, informal claim that there are properties cannot explain
such phenomena in a systematic way, especially when they are combined
(as in ‘Tom believes that it is necessarily the case that being a
seventh son is more like being a sixth son than like being a fifth
son’).
In recent years a number of philosophers (e.g., Bealer, 1982, 1994;
Zalta, 1983, 1988; Chierchia & Turner, 1988; Menzel, 1993) have
developed intricate accounts that include formal logics whose
semantics provide systematic ways of forming "compound" properties
(e.g., loving Darla) to serve as semantic values of complex
predicates (‘loves Darla’) or complex singular terms (‘loving Darla).
The details of such accounts are too complex to pursue here (although
a generic account of some of the central ideas will be sketched in
§8). It should be noted, however, that most
philosophers who aspire to a semantic account of large intensional
fragments of English introduce
propositions, which they treat as zero-place
properties.
The proper treatment of intentional idioms like ‘believes that’ also
require properties that are very finely individuated, probably as
finely individuated as the linguistic expressions that denote or
express them. For example Tom's grasp of logic may be so tenuous that
he believes of Ortcutt that he is a spy and an auditor for the IRS but
doubts that he is an auditor for the IRS and a spy. This is sometimes
taken to suggest that being a spy and an auditor for the IRS is
distinct from the (necessarily coextensive) property being an
auditor for the IRS and a spy. To be sure, few people are guilty
of such blatant lapses, but we can certainly make mistakes when
necessarily coextensive properties are described in more complicated
ways (such errors are routine in mathematics and logic).
On the plausible (though not inevitable) assumption that the
structure of many of our thoughts is similar to the structure of the
sentences we use to describe the contents of those thoughts (‘Sam
thinks Tom is boring but not dishonest’), we might also hope to use
properties in an account of mental content that would in many ways
parallel an account of the semantics of the more intensional fragments
of English.
Accounts that treat the semantic values of predicates as sets can
handle a certain amount of English if we are willing to twist
("regiment") it into a rather complex, even tortured logical form. But
little is gained by this, since such approaches cannot accommodate
such simple intensional phenomena as the fact that two predicates
might just happen to apply to exactly the same things even though they
could have applied to different things. And extensional accounts do
even worse with complex nominalizations or more complicated
intensional idioms like ‘believes that’. Sets (of ordinary things) are
simply too coarse-grained to make the fine distinctions semantic
theories require.
The only serious alternative to the use of properties in formal
semantics treats the semantic values of noun phrases and verb phrases
as intensions. Intensions are functions that assign a set to
the expression at each possible world (or related set-theoretic
devices that encode the same information). On such accounts, for
example, the semantic value of ‘red’ is the function that maps each
possible world to the set of things in that world that are red.
Montague (1974) and linguists and philosophers inspired by his work
have devised systems inspired by this idea that have great elegance
and power. Nevertheless, properties are more natural and better suited
to handle many linguistic constructions than intensions are.
Properties are more natural, because we learn the meanings of many
predicates by ostension, and we group objects together when they share
properties that seem salient or important. I recognize the sound of an
oboe or the taste of rhubarb; these are very direct and simple
experiences that seem completely unrelated to functions from huge
infinite sets of possible worlds to objects therein. If we learn to
recognize certain properties and categorize objects in terms of such
properties, this is relatively easy to understand. But if the semantic
values of predicates are intensions, meanings are now incredibly
complicated set-theoretic objects that require a huge ontology of
possible worlds and, often, merely possible individuals.
Properties are more useful in semantics than intensions because
intensions are still too coarse-grained to explain many semantic
phenomena involving intensional idioms. For example, semantic accounts
that employ intensions would most naturally treat ‘lasted a fortnight’
and ‘lasted two weeks’ as having the same meaning (since they have the
same intension), which makes it difficult for such accounts to explain
how ‘Tom believes the battle lasted two weeks, but does not believe
that it lasted a fortnight’ could be true. Various stratagems are
available to deal with problematic cases like this, but they are much
less natural and involve a much more dubious ontology (all those sets
and possible worlds) than accounts that employ
properties. Furthermore, intensions are unlikely to be able to perform
tasks in areas outside semantics (like naturalistic ontology) that
properties may be able to do. It is natural, for example, to suppose
that things have the capacities that they do (e.g., the capacity to
exert a force on a distant object) because of the properties they
possess (e.g., gravitational mass). But it seems most unlikely that
huge, set-theoretic intensions would be able to explain things like
this.
Some philosophers have construed intensions as providing a
reduction of properties to intensions (properties are nothing
over and above functions from the class of possible worlds to classes
of objects). We have seen that this account has little to recommend
it, and it is much better to view properties (including relations, and
perhaps propositions) as primitive entities. Other philosophers, less
concerned with formal matters, have sometimes envisioned a reduction
of properties to sets of tropes; a discussion of some of the issues
this involves will be found in the entry on
tropes.
Every large-scale theory of the semantics of English generates
anomalies of one sort of another. Furthermore, some accounts require
very large ontologies and very finely-drawn distinctions. For example,
on really fine-grained accounts of the identity conditions of
properties, the relations loving and the converse of its
converse are distinct relations. Similarly, the properties being
red and square and being square and red are distinct. We
might wonder whether such distinctions exist and (if they do) what
enables us to match the right linguistic expressions with the right
relation? How do we match ‘red and square’ and ‘square and
red’ with the correct members of the relevant pair of properties (we
will return to this matter below)?
If the properties needed for semantics are completely isolated from
the natural world, the epistemological problems noted in the previous
subsection (on the philosophy of mathematics) resurface. We might hope
to avoid this by holding that all properties are either instantiated
or that they can be constructed by a series of applications of logical
operations (like conjunction and negation) from properties that are
instantiated. But it is far from clear that we can "construct"
properties to serve as the semantic values for all English predicative
expressions in this way. But could we define properties to serve as
semantic values for all the predicates that lack instances?
Expressions like ‘witch’ have a good bit of open texture, and it is at
best an open question whether we can define them in terms of
properties that are actually instantiated.
Current property-based semantic theories do not accommodate
vagueness. This is a serious shortcoming, because vague predicates
(like ‘bald’) and vague nominalizations (like ‘baldness’) are the
rule, rather than the exception. When property-based semantic theories
are modified to accommodate them, their proponents will have to decide
whether vagueness is an objective feature in the world itself (so that
some properties themselves are vague, in the sense of having vague or
fuzzy extensions), or whether all vagueness resides in language (with
properties having precise extensions and vagueness arising because it
is sometimes somewhat indeterminate which sharp-edged property a given
predicate or nominalization denotes).
Recent empirical work on concepts reinforces the point that many
concepts (and, with them, predicates) have a graded membership and
goes on to stress the importance of phenomena like typicality. Some
creatures are more typical examples of birds than others, and there is
some evidence that we determine whether something is a bird by
assessing how similar (according to some psychological standard of
similarity) it is to typical birds. This and various other phenomena
have inspired a range of accounts of the structures of concepts,
beginning with Rosch's (1978) account of prototypes and now including
other accounts like exemplar theory (where we store exemplars of a
concept in memory and determine what other things fall under that
concept by assessing how similar they are to those exemplars).
Different accounts may well apply to different sorts of concepts (and
perhaps, derivatively, to the predicates associated with them). For
example, most mathematical concepts do have sharp boundaries, whereas
many everyday concepts do not. On many recent psychological accounts,
concepts involve features and similarity relations. Since features
(e.g., having feathers, having a beak) are properties, there is no
reason why current property theories could not be emended and extended
to make contact with such accounts, and it seems likely that this will
be a fruitful line of inquiry in the future (see Margolis &
Laurence, 1999, for a useful selection of papers on concepts).
What do semantic theories based on properties tell us about the
nature of properties? The lessons here are less
straightforward than in the philosophy of mathematics, partly because
a detailed semantic theory must include a number of elements in
addition to a theory of properties. For example, it must include a
theory about the underlying logic in which the theory of properties is
formulated, a theory about the logical forms of various English
constructions (e.g., belief-sentences, gerundive phrases,
parenthetical clauses), and perhaps claims that certain apparent
entailment relations among English sentences don't really hold (e.g.,
because they are implicatures rather than logical entailments).
In short, we test a total package of such assumptions when we
see how well a semantic theory accommodates our intuitions about what
entails what or which groups of sentences are consistent. Moreover,
somewhat different theories of properties may provide equally good
accounts if we make compensatory adjustments in their underlying
logics, in their accounts of the logical form of various
constructions, or in our views about implicatures. Still, we have
seen enough to draw some tentative lessons about properties from their
use in semantics.
Existence Conditions:
If we want to account for the meanings of all predicates or all
abstract singular terms (save for those which would lead to
paradox), we need a very large stock of
properties to serve as their semantic values (and since languages are
extensible, we need properties to serve as the semantic values for any
words that might ever be added).
Identity Conditions:
Even if we only aim to use properties as semantics values for run of
the mill predicates, properties must be more finely individuated than
sets. And if we hope to use properties as part of a systematic
semantic account of belief attributions and other intensional idioms,
they will have to be even more finely individuated than
intensions. They will have to be (at least) nearly as finely
individuated as the linguistic expressions that denote (or express)
them.
Structure:
If we want to account for the behavior of complex predicates or
complex singular terms in a systematic way, properties need to have
something akin to a logical structure (we will explore the relevant
notion of structure in §8.2).
Modal Status:
The use of properties in many parts of semantics does not obviously
require that properties exist necessarily. But when we turn to
portions of English that explicitly involve the alethic modalities and
related notions, i.e., when we turn to sentences (like ‘Red is
necessarily a color’, ‘7 is necessarily prime’), the most natural
accounts will involve properties that exist necessarily.
Epistemic Status:
If properties are used to furnish semantic values for a multitude of
expressions of a natural language like English or Choctaw, then we
will need a lavish realm of properties that includes properties that
are not instantiated. If such properties raise epistemological
problems, then there will be difficulties explaining how our
linguistic behavior, here in the natural world, involves properties we
couldn't know much about. Furthermore, the more facts about language
we can know a priori, the more likely it is that we will need
some sort of a priori access to properties.
In recent years properties have played a central role in
philosophical accounts of scientific realism, measurement, causation,
dispositions, and natural laws. This is a less unified set of concerns
than those encountered in the previous two subsections, but it is
still a clearly recognizable area, and I will call it naturalistic
ontology. The use of properties in naturalistic ontology is often
less formal and more varied than the work in the areas we have
examined. I will indicate the flavor of this work by describing
several noteworthy treatments of topics in the area.
Even quite modest and selective versions of scientific realism are
most easily developed with the aid of properties. This is so because
they offer a way to account for the following phenomena.
Claims that appear to quantify over properties are common in science.
- If one organism is fitter than a conspecific, then there is at
least one property the first organism has that gives it a greater
propensity to reproduce than the second.
- There are many inherited characteristics, but there are no
acquired characteristics that are inherited.
- Properties and relations measured on an interval scale are
invariant under positive linear transformations, but this isn't true
of all properties and relations measured on ordinal scales.
- In a Newtonian world all fundamental ("meaningful") properties
are invariant under Galilean transformations, whereas the fundamental
properties in a special-relativistic world are those that are
invariant under Lorentz transformation.
No one has any idea how to paraphrase most of these claims in a
non-quantificational idiom, and they certainly seem to assert (or
deny) the existence of various sorts of properties. The claim that
this is in fact precisely what they do explains how they can be
meaningful and, in many cases, true.
Many important properties like being a simple harmonic
oscillator, being a gene, being an edge detector, or
being a belief are often thought to be functional
properties. To be a gene, for example, is to play a certain causal
role in the transmission of hereditary information, and it is in
principle possible for quite disparate physical mechanisms to play
this role. To say that something exemplifies a functional property
is, roughly, to say that there are certain properties that it
exemplifies and that together they allow it to play a certain causal
role. For example, DNA molecules have certain properties that allow
them to transmit genetic information in pretty much in the way
described by Mendel's laws. Here again, we have quantifications over
properties that seem unavoidable.
Much explanation in science is causal explanation, and casual
explanations often proceed by citing properties of the things involved
in causal interactions. For example, electrons repel one another in
the way that they do because they have the same charge (we will
return to this below).
A few decades ago claims that one sort of thing was reducible
to a second were common; e.g., one often heard that the temperature of
a gas is reducible to its mean molecular kinetic energy. Nowadays we
are more likely to hear that one sort of thing
supervenes on another: e.g., all
biological (or all psychological) features of an organism supervene on
its physical properties. Such claims make the best sense if we take
them to involve properties. For example the claim that the
psychological realm supervenes on the physical realm is plausibly
construed as the claim that, necessarily, everything that has any
psychological properties also has physical properties and any two
things that have exactly the same physical properties will have
exactly the same psychological properties. Disputes remain about the
best way to spell out the fine print, but almost all of the candidates
advert to properties.
Some philosophers of science, most notably Feyerabend and Kuhn, argue
that theoretical terms draw their meaning from the theories within
which they occur. Hence, they conclude, a change in theory causes a
shift in the meanings of all of its constituent terms, and so
different theories simply talk about different things. And since
Newton's talk of ‘mass’ and Einstein's talk of ‘mass’ are about
different things, their theories cannot be rationally compared; the
theories are "incommensurable". The common realist rejoinder is that
the reference of terms can remain the same even when the surrounding
theory shifts (at least as long as it doesn't shift too much). Now it
is certainly true that some realists have placed a greater explanatory
burden on reference than it can bear. But for this response to work,
even in cases of small shifts in theory, terms like ‘mass’ or ‘rest
mass’ or ‘mass of 3.4kg’ must refer to something, and the most
plausible candidate for this is a property.
Various features of measurement are most easily explained by invoking
properties.
Simpler anti-realist theories of measurement (like operationalism)
cannot explain how we can use different methods to measure the same
thing, e.g., how we can use such different methods to measure lengths
and distances in cosmology, geology, histology, and atomic physics. By
contrast, the view that measurements aim to discover objective
properties can explain this.
In many sciences it is expected that estimates of the magnitude of
measurement error will be reported along with measurement results.
Indeed, in fields like econometrics and psychometrics, extremely
detailed theories of error are always near center stage. But such talk
makes little sense unless there is a fact about what a correct
measurement would be. Since an object can have one magnitude (e.g., a
rest mass of 3kg) at one time and a different magnitude (e.g., a rest
mass of 4kg) at another time, the object alone cannot explain this.
But it is quite naturally explained by assuming that the object
instantiates two different mass properties (namely a rest mass of 3
kg, and a rest mass of 4 kg) at the two different times. It also
explains why later techniques for measuring things can be more
accurate than earlier methods (e.g., why Atwood's machine allowed him
to measure the value of the gravitational constant much more
accurately than his predecessors could).
Nowadays measurement units are often specified directly in terms of
properties. At one time the meter was specified as the length of the
standard meter bar in Paris, But we now specify the meter in terms of
something that can in principle be instantiated anywhere in the world,
e.g., as the length equal to a certain number of wavelengths
(in a vacuum) of a particular color of light emitted by krypton 86
atoms.
These facts have led to several adaptations of the representational
theory of measurement developed by Suppes and his coworkers to a
framework involving properties (Mundy, 1987; Swoyer, 1987). Among
other things, these accounts offer characterizations of the algebraic
structure of many of the properties involved in measurement.
Some philosophers have employed properties in reductive accounts of
causation (cf. Tooley; 1987; Fales, 1990). It would take us too far
afield to explore this work here, but it is worth noting that it is
never a single, undifferentiated amorphous blob of an object (or blob
of an event) that makes things happen. It is an object (or event)
with properties. Furthermore, how it affects things
depends on what these properties are. The liquid in the glass causes
the litmus paper to turn blue because the liquid is an alkaline (and
not because the liquid also happens to be blue). The Earth exerts a
gravitational force of the moon because of their respective
gravitational masses. And because explanations often cite causes, it
is not surprising that explanations frequently cite properties: the
liquid's being an alkaline explains why it turned the litmus paper
blue (this doesn't preclude deeper explanations involving the
molecular mechanisms that underlie this process, but they too will
typically involve properties (like valence and charge)).
Some causal powers are deterministic: any object with a gravitational
mass will exert a certain amount of force on an object with a certain
gravitational mass at a certain distance from it. Others are
indeterministic: photons can be prepared in a state that will
give them a 50/50 chance of making it through a polarizer set at a
certain angle. In some cases the only informative things we can
say about a property are what tendencies or powers or capacities it
confers on its instances. For example, the things we know about
determinate charges have to do with the active and passive powers they
confer on particles that instantiate them, their effects on the
electromagnetic fields surrounding them, and the like. Thus, two
negatively charged particles at a given distance will exert a force
with a specific magnitude and direction on each other that depends on
their respective charges (monadic properties) and the distance between
them (a two-place relation) in accordance with Coulomb's law. Similar
points hold for many other properties in science, including mass,
momentum, force, electrical resistance, tensile strength, torque, and
spin.
Such facts have led some philosophers to claim that properties are
essentially dispositional, or even that properties just are
dispositions. This led to a debate over whether all properties are
dispositional (like charge and spin are) or whether some were
non-dispositional (perhaps like squareness). The discussion here was
considerably clarified by Shoemaker's (1984, p. 210ff) claim that it
is linguistic items, rather than properties, that are
dispositional or not. Some predicates, e.g., ‘fragile’, ‘flexible’,
and ‘irascible’ are dispositional, whereas predicates, e.g., ‘square’
and ‘table’ arguably are not. But all properties confer causal powers
on their instances; a square peg does not have the capacity to fit
into a round hole (below a certain size).
Philosophers who focus on the causal or nomological capacities that
properties confer on their instances often urge that properties are
identical just in case they confer the same capacities
on their instances (e.g., Achinstein, 1974; Armstrong, 1978, Ch. 16;
Shoemaker 1984, Ch. 10-11). This general idea leaves us with questions
about the relationship between properties and the capacities they
bestow, but using fairly intuitive (though not incontrovertible)
counting principles for properties and capacities, we can say the
following:
Different Properties, Same Power: Different properties can
bestow the same powers on their instances. For example, charge and
gravitational mass both bestow a power to exert a force on nearby
objects (that have the right sorts of properties).
Same Property, Different Powers: A single property can bestow
different powers on its instances. For example, a
determinate charge like the unit
negative charge that characterizes electrons confers an ability to
exert an attractive force on positively-charged particles and it
confers an ability to exert a repulsive force on negatively-charged
particles.
Although the connection between properties and powers is important,
it isn't fully understood. Is a capacity an additional sort of
property over and above the property that confers it? This sounds
unduly complicated, but if this is not the case we need an account of
the relationship.
Properties have played a central role in several recent accounts of
natural laws. I will focus on two accounts that put properties at
center stage; hybrids are possible, but the examples discussed here
typify much recent work.
Laws of nature (e.g., the ideal gas laws, Newton's laws,
Shrödinger's equation, Einstein's field equations for general
relativity, conservation laws) have several important features, and
the task of a philosophical account of laws is to explain how this is
so. Different philosophers view different (and sometimes
incompatible) features as central to laws, but those who favor what I
will call N-relation theories agree that laws have (at least
most of) the following five features. I will focus primarily on
deterministic laws, not because they are more important than
probabilistic laws, but because if an account cannot get deterministic
laws right, it will have little chance with probabilistic laws.
- Laws are objective. We don't invent laws, we discover them.
- Laws have modal force. This shows up when we describe laws (or
their implications) using words like ‘must’, ‘require’, ‘preclude’,
and ‘impossible’.
- Laws, unlike accidental generalizations, are confirmed by their
instances and underwrite predictions.
- The line between laws and non-laws is sharp; nomologicality does
not come in degrees (this is implicit in the work of many
N-relation theorists; Armstrong, 1983, p. 71 notes that his
account depends on it).
- Laws have genuine explanatory power. They play a central role in
scientific explanation that accidental generalizations cannot.
N-relation theories have been defended by Armstrong (e.g.,
1978, 1983), Dretske (1977), Tooley (1977) and others. Their accounts
differ in detail, but they share the core idea that laws of nature are
relations among properties. A law is a second-order relation of
nomic necessitation (N, for short) holding among two or more
first-order properties. Hence the logical form of a statement
of a simple law is not ‘All Fs are Gs’; in the case of a law involving
two first-order properties, it is a second-order atomic sentence of
the form ‘N(F,G)’.
In the more exact sciences these first-order properties (our
Fs and Gs) will typically be
determinate magnitudes like a kinetic
energy of 1.6 × 10-2 joule or a force of 1 newton or
an electrical resistance of 12.3 ohms (rather than mass or force or
resistance simpliciter). Hence the laws specified by an equation (like
Newton's second law) are really infinite families of specific laws
where each specific, determinate mass m (a scalar, and so a
monadic property) and total impressed force f (a vector, and so
a relational property) stand in the N-relation to the
appropriate relation (vector) of acceleration a (= f/m).
The Background: N-Relation Theories vs. Regularity Theories
The dominant accounts of laws during much of this century were
regularity theories, and N-relation theories were
originally devised to avoid perceived shortcomings of these earlier
accounts. There are many versions of the regularity theory, but they
share the core idea that laws are simply contingent regularities (or
the sentences expressing them). On such views there is no
metaphysical difference between genuine laws and true
accidental generalizations (at least accidental generalizations
involving purely qualitative predicates or
properties) like ‘all cubes of pure gold weigh less than ten tons’
(which I'll assume is true). According to regularity theorists, the
only difference between laws and accidental regularities is that laws
have some special epistemic or pragmatic or logical trappings (e.g.,
they contain projectible predicates like ‘rest mass’ rather than
‘grue’ or they form part of a powerful deductive theory). The most
prominent version of the regularity theory nowadays is the
Ramsey-Lewis account, according to which laws are those universal
generalizations that would be part of the overall systematization of
our theories about the world that best combines simplicity and
strength.
One of the chief attractions of regularity theories is that they have
a relatively low epistemological cost. We observe instances of many
regularities here in the actual world, and the additional features
used to upgrade regularities to laws are not epistemically problematic
in any deep way. Indeed, although there are various detailed problems
with regularity theories, the major issues between N-relation
theorists and regularity theorists involve the
fundamental ontological tradeoff. According
to N-relation theorists, regularity theories only achieve their
epistemic security by being so weak that they cannot explain the
fundamental features of laws. Regularity theorists counter that the
N-relation is a mysterious bit of metaphysics, and that there
is no way we could ever gain epistemic access to it. N-relation
theorists respond that we should believe in it because it provides the
best explanation of the five items on the above list. Is this response
plausible? To evaluate it we need to look briefly at how those
explanations are supposed to work.
According to N-relation theories, laws are objective because
the N-relation relates those properties it does quite
independently of our language and thought (in the case of properties
that don't specifically involve our language or thought). By contrast,
the epistemic and pragmatic features used by regularity theorists to
demarcate laws from accidental generalizations are too anthropocentric
to account for the objectivity of laws.
Many laws seem to necessitate some things and to preclude others.
Pauli's exclusion principle requires that two fermions occupy
different quantum states. The special theory of relativity doesn't
allow a signal to be propagated at a velocity exceeding that of
light. The laws of thermodynamics show the impossibility of
perpetual motion machines. Conservation laws assure us that such
quantities as angular momentum, mass-energy, and charge cannot
be created or destroyed. The modal force of laws is also said to
manifest itself in the way laws support counterfactuals; had there
been a tenth planet, it too would have obeyed Kepler's Laws. But,
N-relation theorists insist, since regularity theorists
forswear everything modal, they can never account for the modal
aspects of laws.
N-relation theorists often argue that their accounts can, and
that regularity theories cannot, explain how laws are confirmed by
their instances. If laws were mere regularities, then the fact
that observed Fs have been Gs would give us no reason to
conclude that those Fs we haven't encountered will also be
G. If the Fs we have observed are to be relevant
to our belief that unobserved Fs are Gs, then there
needs to be something about an object's being F that
requires (or, in the case of probabilistic laws, makes it probable)
that it will also be G. And if the properties F and
G stand in a nomic relation, then the properties themselves
(and not merely their instances) are related in a law-like way. Hence,
if N-relation accounts are right, there will be
something about an object's being an F that will make it be a
G, and the examined cases will be related to the unexamined
cases in the relevant way.
Properties either stand in the N-relation or they do not. When
they do, we have a law; when they do not, we don't.
The accidental regularity that all cubes of gold weigh less than ten
tons doesn't explain why any particular cube of gold weighs less than
ten tons. But, N-relation theorists often argue, if one
property nomically necessitates a second, that does explain why
anything having the first also has the second.
If N-relation accounts are on the right track, there is a
reasonably rich realm of properties that is structured by one or more
nomic relations. But before drawing this conclusion we should note
that N-relation theories face difficulties of their
own. Indeed, it is unclear whether N-relation theories can
successfully explain all of the things they were introduced to
explain, but we will focus on two more general difficulties here. (A
fuller discussion of the problems for N-relation theories
can be found in the supplementary document
Difficulties for N-relation Accounts of Natural Laws.)
First, it is not clear how to extend N-relation accounts to
deal with several important kinds of laws, most prominently
conservation laws and symmetry principles. Second, even in the case
of laws that can be coaxed (or crammed) into the N-relation
scheme, the account involves a highly idealized notion whose
connection to the things that go by the name ‘law’ in labs
and research centers is rather remote.
At this point some philosophers propose a distinction between the
current laws of science and the true laws of nature. The
former are approximate, idealized and provisional, whereas the later
are precise, definite and unchanging. Furthermore, they continue,
while it is perfectly respectable for philosophers to discuss the
current laws of science, philosophy should also provide an account of
the true laws of nature. But although some philosophers propose lists
(like the one above) of features that are supposed to characterize the
true laws of nature, it is not clear that there are any laws of this
sort. At all events, current science doesn't force this conclusion on
us, and the claim that there are such laws involves a bit of
metaphysical speculation.
If we begin with actual scientific laws, we are likely to come up
with quite different features from those on the
list above.
- Laws almost always involve approximation and idealization
Sometimes the idealization is so great that a law is quite inaccurate
over parts of the range of phenomena it is supposed to cover (as is
the law for the simple pendulum or the general gas laws). Most laws
only hold ceteris paribus, "other things being equal," but
other things rarely are.
- When we apply a law to a situation, we often use a highly
simplified version of the law that everyone acknowledges is false.
- Laws are not in any straightforward way confirmed by their
instances. Actual data and phenomena that provide evidence for a law
rarely fit it exactly (even when we discount for measurement error).
- We often explain things by citing the causal mechanisms and
processes they involve, rather than by subsuming them under general
laws. For example, we do not explain why all crows are black by saying
(in some more idiomatic way) that the N-relation holds between
the properties being a crow and being black. We explain
it by finding causal (in this case genetic) mechanisms that link the
two properties. In other cases we appeal to a deeper theory, e.g., we
explain why Kepler's laws hold (to the extent that they do) by
deriving (approximations of) them from Newton's laws.
- The distinction between laws and accidental generalizations is a
matter of degree. We often talk as though some laws (e.g., various
conservation laws) are very fundamental and robust, while other laws
(e.g., Hooke's Law, Boyle's Law, Gresham's Law) are less so.
A philosopher who sees 1-5 as central features of laws will be drawn
to an account that is very different from that proposed by
N-relation theorists. Far from involving universal (or even
precise probabilistic) nomological relations, actual laws are
idealized, approximate, and limited in scope (often applying only to
highly artificial systems created in laboratories or even just to
simplified models of real systems).
When N-relation theories first appeared on the scene much of
their appeal was that they promised a better account of the
objectivity and (perhaps) the modal status of laws than regularity
theories could provide. But it is now possible to discern the
beginnings of an account that explains these things (to the limited
degree that they hold) and that also explains how actual laws work. I
will quickly sketch a generic version of such an account here (several
versions are in the air, but most of them owe a large debt to
Cartwright, 1983; 1989).
We have already noted that (at least many) properties confer causal
capacities and tendencies on their instances. For example,
electrically charged particles have a capacity to exert forces on
other particles and to affect an electromagnetic field around them
in virtue of the property of having a specific, determinate
charge. This is a perfectly objective fact, and it has a certain
modal force (if the particles had moved away from each other, the
forces would have fallen off with the square of the distance between
them). This suggests the view that laws result from the operations of
capacities (including probabilistic capacities). Laws tell us what
happens when we shield off (or hold constant) the influence of other
capacities and allow a single capacity (or just a few capacities)
to work without interference. In a few cases we can shield the
operation of a single capacity from outside influences in a way that
allows us to make fairly precise and accurate predictions, and cases like
this may approximate the N-relation theorist's conception of a
law. But most laws, and most applications of laws, aren't like
this. The detailed behavior of most things, including many relatively
simple physical systems, results from the joint operation of many
capacities or tendencies, and often it cannot be predicted, or even
explained, on the basis of such laws. Accounts like Cartwright's take
science at face value and they leave room for laws in fields other
than basic physics. But for our purposes the most important thing
about them is that they, like N-relation theories, place
properties at center stage.
The work discussed in this subsection suggests that properties
include determinate physical magnitudes like being a mass of 3.7
kg and being an electrical resistance of 7
ohms. Furthermore, such properties typically form families of
ordered determinates (e.g., the family of determinate masses) that
have a definite algebraic structure (Mundy, 1987; Swoyer, 1987). It
also suggests that a fundamental feature of at least many properties
is that they confer causal capacities on their instances. Work on
naturalistic ontology doesn't entail detailed answers to every
question about the nature of properties, but it does suggest answers
to some of them.
Existence Conditions:
A natural, though not inevitable, conclusion to draw from the work
discussed in this subsection is that properties exist only if they
confer causal or nomological capacities on their instances. For
properties: to be is to (be able to) confer causal capacities.
Identity Conditions:
The most natural conclusion to draw here is that properties are
identical just in case they confer exactly the same causal powers on
their instances.
Structure:
If N-relation theories are right, the realm of properties is
structured in at least the minimal sense that many pairs of properties
stand in one or more higher-order nomological relations. Properties
are also related to the causal powers they confer on their instances
in some intimate, though not clearly understood, way.
Modal Status:
If laws of nature are metaphysically necessary, then properties that
actually stand in the N-relation stand in that relation in all
possible worlds in which they exist. The fact that properties confer
causal powers on their instances is also naturally understood as the
claim that the instances of a property have those powers in all
possible worlds in which that property exists.
Epistemic Status:
Philosophers who employ properties to provide explanations in
naturalistic ontology typically hold that we learn about properties
empirically. On some accounts all properties are instantiated, and we
learn about them because their instances affect our sensory apparatus
or our measuring instruments. On other accounts some properties are
uninstantiated, but they are related to properties that are
instantiated in systematic ways. For example, a specific determinate
mass (e.g., 4 kg) might be uninstantiated, but we can describe it
quite precisely (as twice as great a mass as 2 kg, which is, let us
suppose, exemplified). Furthermore, we can say what causal powers it
would have conferred on its instances, had it had any (e.g., we can
say what gravitational force its instances would have exerted on a 2
kg object 5 meters away).
At this point it is useful to step back to note the fundamental way
in which the general conception of properties discussed in this
subsection differs from many of the conceptions discussed earlier. On
those earlier conceptions at least many properties are causally inert,
other-worldly, abstract entities that exist outside space and time;
they are timeless, necessary beings, and since we cannot come into
causal contact with them, our knowledge of them is problematic.
By contrast, the view that emerges from much of the work in
naturalistic ontology treats properties as contingent beings that are
intimately related to the causal, spatio-temporal order, and we learn
what properties there are and what they are like through empirical
investigation. Such properties are not much like meanings or
concepts, and so it is possible to discover that a property conceived
of in one way (e.g., the property of being water) is identical with a
property conceived in some quite different way (e.g., the property of
being H2O). It might be misleading to call such properties
‘concrete’ (the standard antonym of the slippery word ‘abstract’), but
it isn't quite right to call them ‘abstract’ either. Indeed, the stark
dichotomy between the abstract and concrete is probably too simple to
be useful here.
What properties are there? Under what conditions does a property
exist? In formal accounts--those modeled on axiomatic set theory or
axiomatic treatments of other mathematical entities--the goal is
typically to find formal principles (like
comprehension schemas)
that state sufficient (and, with luck, necessary) conditions for the
existence of properties. But the basic issues about the existence
conditions of properties are not really formal ones. Indeed, views
about their existence conditions typically derive from an interplay of
views about the explanatory tasks of properties and legitimate
constraints on philosophical explanation.
We can view the array of views about the existence conditions of
properties as a continuum, with claims that the realm of properties is
sparse over on the right (conservative) end and claims that it is
bountiful over on the left (liberal) end.
According to minimalist conceptions of properties, the realm of
properties is sparsely populated. This is a comparative claim (it is
more thinly populated than many realists suppose), rather than a claim
about cardinality. Indeed, a minimalist could hold that there is a
large infinite number of properties, say that there are at least as
many properties as real numbers. This would be a natural view, for
example, for a philosopher who thought that each value of a physical
magnitude is a separate property and that field theories of such
properties as gravitational potentials are correct in their claim that
the field intensity drops off continuously as we move away from the
source of the field.
The best-known contemporary exponent of minimalism is David Armstrong
(e.g., 1978, 1984, 1997), though it has also been defended by others
(e.g., Swoyer, 1996). Specific reductionist motivations (e.g., a
commitment to physicalism) can lead to minimalism, but here we will
focus on more general motivations. These motivations typically involve
some combination of the view that everything that exists at all exists
in space and time (or space-time), a desire for epistemic security,
and a distrust of modal notions like necessity. Hence, a minimalist is
likely to subscribe to at least most of the following four principles.
The principle of instantiation says that there are no
uninstantiated properties. For properties: to be is to be
exemplified. Taken alone the principle of instantiation doesn't
enforce a strong version of minimalism, since it might be that a wide
array of properties are exemplified. For example, someone who thinks
that numbers or individual essences or other abstract objects exist
would doubtless think that a vast number of properties are
exemplified. So it is useful to distinguish two versions of the
principle of instantiation.
Weak Instantiation: All properties are instantiated; there
are no uninstantiated properties.
Strong Instantiation: All properties are instantiated by
things that exist in space and time (or, if properties can themselves
instantiate properties, each property is part of a descending chain of
instantiations that bottoms out in individuals in space and time).
Armstrong (1978) holds that properties enjoy a timeless sort of
existence; if a property is ever instantiated, then it
always exists. A more rigorous minimalism holds that properties
are mortal; a property only exists when it is exemplified. This
account has an admirable purity about it, but it is hard pressed to
explain very much; for example, if laws are relations among
properties, then a law would seem to come and go as the properties
involved did.
Philosophers who subscribe to the strong principle of instantiation
are almost certain to hold that properties are contingent
beings. It is a contingent matter just which individuals exist and
what properties they happen to exemplify, so it is a contingent matter
what properties there are.
A natural consequence of the view that properties are contingent
beings is that questions about which properties exist are
empirical. There are no logical or conceptual or any other a
priori methods to determine which properties exist.
Those who hold that properties are very finely individuated will be
inclined to hold that the realm of properties is fairly bountiful.
For example, if the relation of loving and the converse of its
converse (and the converse of the converse of that, and so on) are
distinct, then properties will be plentiful. Minimalists, by contrast,
are more likely to hold that properties are identical just in case
they necessarily have the same instances or just in case they bestow
the same causal powers on their instances. On these views the converse
of the converse of a binary relation will just be that relation itself
(we will return to this matter in the section on
identity conditions of properties).
The strong principle of instantiation opens the door to the claim
that properties are literally located in their instances. This is a
version of Medieval philosophers' doctrine of universalia in
rebus, which was contrasted with the picture of universalia
ante rem, the view that properties are transcendent beings that
exist apart from their instances. With properties firmly rooted here
in the spatio-temporal world, it may seem less mysterious how we could
learn about them, talk about them, and use them to provide
illuminating explanations. For it isn't some weird, other-worldly
entity that explains why this apple is red; it is something in
the apple, some aspect of it, that accounts for this. It is easier,
however, to think of monadic properties as located in their instances
than it is to view relations in this way (this may be why Aristotle
and the moderate realists of the middle ages viewed a relation as an
accident that inheres in a single thing). Nevertheless, the general
feeling that transcendent properties couldn't explain anything about
their instances has figured prominently in many debates over
properties.
Minimalists must pay a price for their epistemic security (there's no
escaping the fundamental ontological tradeoff). They will have little
hope of finding enough properties for a semantic account of even a
modest fragment of any natural language and they will be hard pressed
(though Armstrong, 1997, does try) to use properties to account for
phenomena in the philosophy of mathematics. Minimalists may not be
greatly bothered by this, however, for many of them are primarily
concerned with issues in naturalistic ontology.
At the other, left, end of the spectrum we find maximalist
conceptions of properties. Borrowing a term from Arthur Lovejoy,
maximalists argue that properties obey a principle of
plenitude. Every property that could possibly exist does
exist. For properties: To be is to be possible (Linsky & Zalta,
1995; cf. Jubien, 1989). If one accepts the view that properties are
necessary beings, then it is a simple modal fact that if a property is
possible it is necessary and, hence, actual.
Just as the principle of instantiation alone does not guarantee
minimalism, the principle of plenitude alone does not guarantee
maximalism. One can endorse the former while holding that all sorts of
properties are instantiated, and one can endorse the latter by holding
that very few properties are possible (an actualist who subscribed to
the strong principle of instantiation might hold this). So to get to
the maximalist end of the spectrum we need to add the claim that a
vast array of properties is possible. Various formal principles, e.g.,
a strong comprehension principle (e.g., Zalta, 1988) and axioms
ensuring very finely-individuated properties (e.g., Bealer, 1982,
p. 65; Menzel, 1986, p. 38) are two formal ways to achieve this.
Maximalist accounts are often propounded by philosophers who want to
explain meaning and mental content, but since such accounts postulate
so many properties that maximalists have the resources to offer
accounts of other things (e.g., phenomena in the foundations of
mathematics), and many do. Indeed, the great strength of maximalism
is that its enormously rich ontology offers the resources to explain
all sorts of things.
Epistemology is the Achilles' heel of maximalism. At least some
philosophers find it difficult to see how our minds could make
epistemic contact (and how our words could make semantic contact) with
entities lying outside the spatio-temporal, causal order. But
maximalism has its advantages. Those maximalists who are untroubled by
epistemic angst typically remain maximalists. By contrast,
philosophers who begin as minimalists sometimes feel pressure to move
to a richer conception of properties, either to extend their
explanations to cover more phenomena or, sometimes, even just to
adequately explain the things they started out trying to explain
(e.g., Armstrong's more recent work is somewhat less minimalist than
his earliest work).
There is a large middle ground between extreme minimalism and extreme
maximalism. For example, several philosophers primarily concerned with
physical ontology have urged that a limited number of uninstantiated
properties are needed to account for features of measurement (Mundy,
1987), vectors (Bigelow and Pargetter, 1990, p. 77), or natural laws
(Tooley, 1987). Such accounts can, like minimalism, treat properties
as contingent, fairly coarsely individuated, and too sparse to satisfy
any general comprehension principles (e.g., they may deny that there
are negative or disjunctive properties). One can also arrive at a
centrist position by endorsing a comprehension principle but adding
that it only guarantees the existence of properties built up from an
initial, sparse, stock of simple properties (cf. Bealer, 1994,
p. 167).
Being moderate isn't always easy, and it can be difficult to stake
out a position in the center that doesn't appear arbitrary. Once
any uninstantiated properties are admitted, we are in much the
same epistemological boat as the maximalist. No doubt the minimalist
will see this as a reason to reject any uninstantiated properties,
while the maximalist (who believes that epistemological problems can
be overcome) will see it as a reason to admit as many as possible.
There is some reason to think that accounts in different fields
(e.g., semantics and natural ontology) may call for entities with
different identity conditions; for example, semantics requires very
finely individuated properties whereas naturalist ontology may need
more coarsely individuated ones. If this is so, then no single kind of
entity could do both kinds of jobs. The minimalist is likely to
conclude that it is a mistake to employ properties in semantics. But
less squeamish philosophers may instead conclude that there are (at
least) two different sorts of property-like entities. Bealer's (1982)
qualities and concepts and Lewis's (1986) sparse and abundant
properties are examples of this approach. But this happy hybrid won't
satisfy everyone, since minimalists (and some centrists) will reject
the view that there are any concepts or abundant properties.
Disputes over the existence conditions of properties splinter into
several related, but distinct, issues.
- Instantiation issues: Must a property be exemplified to exist?
- Localization Issues: Do exemplified properties exist in space and
time (namely where they are instantiated)?
- Modal issues: Are properties contingent beings or are at least
some necessary beings?
- Epistemological issues: Is the only way to discover the existence
of properties though empirical means?
- Individuation issues: How finely individuated are properties?
Minimalists hold that all properties are contingent beings,
that they must be exemplified in space and time to exist, that we can
only discover their existence empirically, and that they are fairly
coarsely individuated. Some minimalists also hold that they exist in
those locations where they are instantiated. Maximalists reject all
of these views. These two sets of views form fairly natural packages,
but other combinations are possible, and they lead to views falling
between the two extremes.
What are the identity conditions for properties? An answer would give
us necessary and sufficient conditions for the properties x and
y to be one and the same property. Another way to pose the
question is to ask how finely individuated properties are, and here we
find a spectrum of views.
- Infra-coarse: Properties with the same extension are the
same properties (this holds for Frege's concepts, but all contemporary
property theories reject this claim; it is included simply as a point
of reference).
- Medium coarse: Properties are identical just in case they
necessarily have the same extension.
- Medium Fine:
- Properties are identical just in case they confer the same
causal or, more generally, the same nomological powers on their
instances (i.e., they are identical if they play the same functional
role), or
- Properties are identical just in case they are encoded by
exactly the same abstract objects (Zalta)
- Ultra-fine: Properties are individuated almost as finely
as the linguistic expressions that express them. A natural way to work
this out is to develop an account of the analysis of a property and to
hold that properties are identical just in case they have the same
analysis (cf. Bealer's account of concepts; Menzel, 1993).
On most medium-fine views, formal considerations alone do not
determine identity conditions for properties.
Probably the best-know candidate for an identity condition for
properties is necessary coextensiveness. This seems to transpose the
identity conditions for sets into an appropriately intensional key,
and this is precisely how identity conditions for properties work in
accounts that treat them as intensions (as
functions from possible worlds to objects therein). Bealer also views
this as the identity condition for his sparse properties, qualities
and connections (though he is undogmatic about this).
Although necessary coextension may be the most-discussed candidate
identity condition for properties, many realists reject it because it
doesn't comport well with the explanations they want to
develop. Identity conditions don't matter greatly when the aim is
simply to explain mathematical phenomena; even extensional entities
like sets could do that job, so we don't need necessary coextension as
an identity condition here. This proposal is also in tension with the
picture that properties are individuated by their functional roles, at
least on the assumption that necessarily coextensive properties can
confer different causal powers on their instances (Sober, 1982,
contains a strong argument that this can happen, though the jury is
probably still out on this issue). And in semantics we need
hyper-intensional properties that are individuated much more finely
than the necessary-coextension condition allows.
The view that properties are identical just in case they confer the
same causal, or more generally, the same nomological or functional
roles on their instances has been endorsed by various philosophers who
work primarily in scientific ontology. On this conception, there are
few, if any, purely formal identity conditions for properties (unless,
as seems unlikely, someone devises a purely formal account of causal
roles). One cost of this view is that the notion of a causal role and
the relationship between such roles and properties is not completely
clear.
We have encountered all of the major current views about the identity
conditions of properties except for one in previous sections, so we
will go into it in a bit more detail here. The encoding account of
property identity, proposed in Zalta (1983; 1988), is developed in
the context of a rich theory of properties that goes along with a rich
theory of abstract objects. In this theory, ordinary objects (like
Bill Clinton) exist, exemplify properties, but cannot encode
properties. By contrast (on the most common interpretation of his
system), abstract objects (like Pegasus and the Euclidean triangle)
exist necessarily, but they necessarily fail to have a spatio-temporal
location. Abstract objects encode, as well as exemplify, properties;
indeed, an abstract object is constituted by the properties it
encodes. For example, the abstract object the Euclidean triangle
encodes all and only those properties implied by being a triangle of
Euclidean geometry (e.g., being a closed three-side plane figure whose
interior angles sum to 180 degrees). This abstract object also
exemplifies properties, e.g., being mentioned in all textbooks on
plane geometry.
The metaphysical theory of abstract objects is linked to our actual
thought and talk by the bridge principle that the English copula is
ambiguous; sometimes ‘is’ means ‘exemplifies’, sometimes ‘encodes’.
The existence condition for abstract objects is given by a
comprehension schema according to which there is (necessarily) a
unique abstract object that encodes just those properties satisfying
each condition on properties specifiable in the language of the
theory, and abstract objects are identical just in case they encode
exactly the same properties. More importantly, for current purposes,
properties are identical just in case they are, necessarily and
always, encoded by exactly the same individuals.
On this account, properties that necessarily have the same
encoding extensions are identical, but properties that
necessarily have the same exemplification extensions may be
distinct. To see the difference, note that the property of
being a round square and the property of being a round triangle
necessarily have the same exemplification extension. Hence, accounts
(like those noted in §6.3) that treat
necessary (exemplification) coextension as sufficient for identity
tell us that they are one and the same property. But since these
properties have different encoding extensions, the present account
treats them as distinct. One can even make this work without any
actual abstract objects, though the nonidentity of two properties
would still require that there could have been an abstract
object that encodes one but not the other. This is one of the few
novel accounts of property identity to be proposed in recent decades.
It has the virtue of being part of a detailed theory that has been
employed to explain a wide range of phenomena, and it expresses the
identity conditions for properties in terms of one of their most
fundamental features, namely that they are predicable entities. The
price is that it requires us to hold that there are two modes of
predication and that there are, or at least that there could have
been, abstract objects.
The view that properties have ultra-fine identity conditions is
typically developed in the context of a rich formal theory of
properties. One could mandate fine-grained identity conditions by
brute force, e.g., by laying down axioms that each set of objects is
in the extension of more than one property, or in the extension of
many different properties. But the intuitive idea behind property
theories tailored to semantics is that there are "compound properties"
which are built up from simpler properties by logical operations akin
to conjunction, negation, and so on. On such accounts the property
being red and square is distinct (because built up in a
different way) from the property being square and red.
Similarly, the converse of the converse of a two-place relation is
distinct from that relation itself.
Such accounts may be well-suited for explaining strongly intensional
phenomena (like belief sentences or mental content), but they also
raise certain questions. For example, what is the difference between
the property being red and square and the distinct property
being square and red, and what allows us to link the right
complex predicate (say ‘is red and square’) to the right property
(being red and square) rather than to the wrong one (being
square and red)? If properties literally had parts, the answer
might be that the arrangements of things in the two properties is
different (e.g., being red comes "first" in being red and
square). Explaining what such structural differences amount to
would not be easy, but at least such differences might point to the
beginnings of a solution. By contrast, if properties lack genuine
internal structure, it is less clear how an account of the difference
between being red and square and being square and red
would even begin. We will return briefly to such matters in the
final section.
Most realists agree that there are various sorts of properties, and
in this section we will review the main kinds of properties they have
proposed. But many realists are also selective; they believe that
some, but not all, of these kinds of properties exist. Indeed,
almost none of the putative kinds of properties discussed here
is accepted by all realists, but to avoid constant qualifications
(like ‘putative kind of property’) I will present each sort of
property as though it were unproblematic.
The first set of issues we will examine involve the most fundamental
logical or structural features of properties. We will begin with a
picture of a hierarchy of properties arranged according to
order. First-order properties and relations are those that can only be
instantiated by individuals. For example redness can be
instantiated by the apple on my desk and being married to can
be instantiated by Bill and Hillary, but no properties can be red or
married. It is natural to suppose, however, that at least many
first-order properties and relations can themselves have properties
and relations. For example, redness might be thought to
exemplify the property of being a color and being married
to might be thought to exemplify the property of being a
symmetrical relation. Once we think of second-order properties, it
is natural to wonder whether there are third-order properties
(properties of second- or, perhaps in cumulative fashion, of second-
and first-order properties), and so on up through ever-higher
orders.
This metaphysical picture finds a formal parallel in higher-order
logics. On one common system of classification, we move from familiar
first-order logic to second-order logic by adding first-order
variables, from second- to third-order logic by adding second-order
constants, from third- to fourth-order logic by adding second-order
variables, and so on up, alternating constants and variables at
successive steps.
Realists differ over which niches in this proposed hierarchy of
orders are occupied. Proponents of the
empirical conception
of properties will hold that it is an empirical question whether there
are second- or forth- or fifty-seventh-order properties. The issue for
them is likely to be whether putative higher-order properties confer
any causal powers on their instances over and above those already
conferred by lower-order properties. But it is also possible to have
less empirically motivated views about which parts of the hierarchy
are occupied.
Elementarism (Bergmann, 1968) is the view that there are
first-order properties but that there are no properties of any
higher-order. There are first-order properties like various shades of
red, but there is no higher-order property (like being a color)
that such properties share nor are they related by any higher-order
relations (like being darker than).
Elementarism has sometimes been defended by appealing to something
like Russell's principle of acquaintance, the tenet that only
things with which we are acquainted should be thought to exist,
together with the claim that we are acquainted with first-order
properties but not with those of any higher orders. To the extent that
first-order properties are able to perform all of the tasks that
properties are called on to do, elementarism could also be defended on
grounds of parsimony. But it is now widely acknowledged, even by
minimalists, that at the very least some higher-order relations are
needed to confer structure on first-order properties.
In May of 1901 Russell discovered his famous paradox. If every
predicative expression determines or corresponds to a property, then
the expressions ‘is a property that does not instantiate itself’
should do so. This raises the question: does this property instantiate
itself? Suppose that it does. Then it is a property that does
not instantiate itself; so if it does instantiate itself, it doesn't
instantiate itself. Now suppose that it does not instantiate
itself. Then it is one of those properties that does not instantiate
itself; so it does instantiate itself. Such a property, which
instantiates itself if and only if it does not instantiate itself,
cannot exist (on pain of contradiction). This led Russell to
introduce a theory of types which institutes a total ban on
self-exemplification by a strict segregation of properties into orders
(his account is actually even more restrictive than this; see the
entry on
Russell's paradox for details).
Russell's reaction seems extreme, because many cases of
self-exemplification are innocuous. Furthermore, realists who are not
minimalists or conservative centrists are likely to think that
self-exemplification is common. For example, the property of being a
property is itself a property, so it exemplifies itself. There also
seem to be transcendental properties and relations. A transcendental
relation like thinks about is one that can relate quite
different types of things: Hans can think about Vienna and he can
think about triangularity. But typed theories cannot
accommodate transcendental properties without several epicycles.
Several recent accounts (e.g., Bealer, 1982; Menzel, 1993) treat
properties as entities that can exemplify themselves. From this
perspective, the picture of a hierarchy of orders is fundamentally
misguided; there are simply properties (which can be exemplified--in
many cases by other properties, even by themselves) and individuals
(which cannot be exemplified). One challenge here is to develop
formal accounts that allow as much
self-exemplification as possible without teetering over the brink into
paradox. In formal systems where abstract singular terms or predicates
may (but need not) denote properties (cf. Swoyer, 1998), formal
counterparts of (complex) predicates like ‘being a property that does
not exemplify itself’ could exist in the object language without
denoting properties; from this perspective Russell's paradox would
merely show that this predicate lacked a denotation, rather than that
the logic was inconsistent.
We have treated relations as properties (with more than one argument
place); for example the properties of loving and being
shorter than are two-place relations, that of being in
between (two other things) is a three-place relation, and so
on. On abundant conceptions of properties, there are relations of
every finite number of argument places, but on sparse conceptions it is
an empirical question whether there are relations of any particular
degree (i.e., with any particular number of argument places). What we
think of as genuine relations were not recognized by philosophers
until about a century and a half ago (with the work of DeMorgan,
Schroeder, and Peirce and, somewhat later, Russell). Until then
relations were treated as a special sort of monadic property (when
they were acknowledged at all).
We have seen how several selective realisms focus on the hierarchy of
orders, but selective realisms can also focus on the degree
(the number of argument places) of relations. Leibniz argued that
relations could be reduced to monadic properties (though he never
really explained just how this was to work) and so were
dispensable. Some philosophers still hold that relations supervene on
the monadic properties of their relata in a very strong sense that
shows that relations are not actually real (some trope theorists hold
this view; it is defended at length in Fisk, 1972). But no one has
been able to show that all relations do supervene on monadic
properties, and there are strong reasons for thinking that at least
some sorts of relations, e.g., spatio-temporal ones, do not. Hence,
most contemporary realists hold that there are genuine relations.
Other selective realisms are possible. For example, in contrast with
Leibniz's view one might hold that there are relations but no monadic
properties (this view is sometimes attributed, with very little
textual support, to Peirce). And Armstrong (1978, ch. 24) proposes the
tentative hypothesis that there are first- and second-level monadic
properties, but no monadic properties of any higher-level.
Many predicates are multigrade or variably polyadic;
they can be true of various numbers of things. For example, the
predicate ‘robbed a bank together’ is true of Bonnie and Clyde, Ma
Barker and her two boys, Patti Hearst and three members of the
Symbionese Liberation Army, and so on. Multigrade predicates are very
common (e.g., ‘work well together’, ‘conspired to commit murder’, ‘are
lovers’). Some of them can be analyzed as conjunctions of fixed-degree
predicates, but many of them cannot. Standard logic does not
accommodate multigrade predicates, but they are very common, and if
the goal is to use properties as semantic values of English
predicates, then multigrade properties are needed. They have also been
used in naturalistic ontology in an ingenious treatment of measurement
(Mundy, 1989). A truly flexible account of properties would abandon
both the restrictive hierarchy of orders and the equally restrictive
view that all properties come with a fixed number of argument places,
but as yet little work of this sort has been done.
In ancient and Medieval times propositions were not seen as a special
kind of property (in those days philosophers didn't even recognize
genuine autonomous relations), and many contemporary philosophers who
focus on physical ontology or philosophy of mathematics do not regard
propositions as a kind of property (many of them doubt that there are
any such things). But those who work on the semantics of natural
language often postulate the existence of propositions, noting that we
can think of them as a limiting case of a property. Consider a
two-place property like loves and think of plugging one of its
open places up with Darla to obtain the one-place property loves
Darla. If we can do this, it is sometimes argued, then we can plug
the remaining (last) open place up with Sam to get the zero-place
property, or proposition, that Sam loves Darla.
Some philosophers (e.g., Grossman, 1983, §§58-61) argue
that all properties are simple. Others argue that there is a
distinction between simple properties and compound
properties, that some compound properties exist, and that they
have a structure that involves or incorporates simpler properties.
Properties might have different sorts of structure, including various
sorts of algebraic or logical structure. Because such issues often
arise in connection with formal accounts of properties, this issue is
discussed in the section on
formal theories of properties.
If instantiation or exemplification is just another run-of-the-mill
relation, it appears to lead to a vicious regress. This is often known
as Bradley's regress, although it is doubtful that Bradley
himself had this particular regress in mind. The construal of the
Bradley's regress that has passed into the literature goes like this.
Suppose that the individual a has the property F. For
a to instantiate F it must be linked to F
by a relation of instantiation, I. But (here's where the
trouble begins), this requires a further pair of relations,
R1 and R2, one to connect a
to I and a second to connect I to F. This in
turn requires four additional relations to bind R1
and R2 to the things that they are supposed to
relate, then eight further relations to fasten these four relations to
their relata, and so on without end. It is sometimes suggested that
the regress is innocuous, but the problem isn't simply that there is a
regress. The problem is that at each "stage" further relations are
required, but they are never able to link their would-be
relata. The difficulty is that nothing ever gets connected to
anything else.
The only way to avoid this difficulty is to insist that instantiation
is not a relation, at least not a normal one. Some philosophers hold
that it is a sui generis linkage that hooks things up without
intermediaries. Strawson (1959), following W. E. Johnson, calls it a
non-relational tie; others stress that it is a mode of
predication. It may even be that there is no such thing as
instantiation at all and that talk of it is just a misleading figure
of speech. At this point it is natural to resort to metaphors like
Frege's claim that properties have gaps that can be filled by objects
or the early Wittgenstein's suggestion (if we read him as a realist
about properties) that objects and properties can be hooked together
like links in a chain. Broad likened instantiation to Metaphysical
Glue, noting that when we glue two sheets of paper together we don't
need additional glue, or mortar, or some other adhesive to bind the
glue to the paper (Broad 1933, p.85). Glue just sticks. And
instantiation just relates. It is metaphysically self-adhesive.
Some properties are metaphysical analogues of count nouns. They have
been called sortal properties (by Strawson) and
particularizing properties (by Armstrong), but the ideas
involved here have a long history. Strawson borrows the word ‘sortal’
from Locke, and at least some particularizing properties correspond
closely to Aristotle's secondary substances. Particularizing
properties provide counting principles, or principles on identity, in
the sense that they allow us to count objects. For example, the
properties of being a table and being a cat are
particularizing properties; there are definite facts of the matter as
to how many tables are in the kitchen and how many cats are on those
tables. There are also properties, e.g., intervention,
bombing, that particularize events.
Characterizing Properties
Particularizing properties are naturally contrasted with
characterizing properties. Characterizing properties like
redness and triangularity do not divide the world up
into a definite number of things. To the extent that a property like
redness seems to allow us to count red things, it is because we
are relying on the umbrella count noun ‘thing’ to help with the count.
Mass Properties
Particularizing properties may also be contrasted with mass
properties. These are properties, like water, gold,
and furniture, that apply to stuff. Like characterizing
properties, mass properties do not divide the world up into definite
numbers of things, but many characterizing properties apply to
individuals, whereas mass properties apply to stuff. It was noted
above that different sorts of linguistic categories that
might correspond to important ontological distinctions are run
together we represent all of them as predicates of a formal
language. It now appears, for example, that common nouns express
particularizing properties, while adjectives typically express
characterizing properties.
Although the notions of genus and species play a
relatively small role in contemporary metaphysics, they figured
prominently in Aristotle's philosophy and in the many centuries of
work inspired by it. When we construe these notions as properties
(rather than as linguistic expressions), a genus is a general property
and a species is a more specific subtype of it. The distinction is
typically thought to be a relative one: being a mammal is a
species relative to the genus being an animal, but it is a
genus relative to the species being a donkey. It has usually
been assumed that in such chains there is a top-most, absolute genus,
and a bottom-most, absolute species.
It was traditionally supposed that a species could be uniquely
specified or defined in terms of a genus and a differentia. For
example, the property being a human is completely determined by
the properties being an animal (genus) and being
rational (differentia). It is difficult, by today's lights, to
draw a principled distinction between genera and differentiae, but the
idea that species properties are compound,
conjunctive properties remains a natural one. For example, the
property of being a human might be identified with the
conjunctive property being a human and being rational. But it
is now rarely assumed, as it was for many centuries, that all compound
properties are conjunctive.
The concepts of determinables and determinates were
popularized by the Cambridge philosopher W. E. Johnson. Properties
like color and shape are determinables, while more
specific versions of these properties (like redness and
octagonality) are determinates. Like the distinction between
genus and species, the distinction between determinables and
determinates is a relative one; redness is a determinate with respect
to color but a determinable with respect to specific shades of
red. The hierarchy is generally thought to bottom out, however, in
completely specific, absolute determinates.
Species are often thought to be definable in terms of a genus and a
differentia. But determinates are not definable in terms of a
determinable and a differentia; indeed, they are not conjunctive
properties of any obvious sort. Determinates under the same
determinable are incompatible; nothing can instantiate both of them at
the same time, and anything that exemplifies a determinate must
exemplify its determinables as well. The distinction between
determinables and determinates has played a larger role in recent
metaphysics than the more venerable distinction between genus and
species. For example, much recent work in
naturalistic ontology treats physical
magnitudes as absolute determinate properties (like being a mass of
3 kg or being a force of 17 newtons) falling under
determinables like mass and force.
Any object that instantiates a determinate (e.g. red) must have the
corresponding determinable (e.g., color), and Armstrong has raised the
question whether determinables are genuine properties or whether we
simply apply determinable predicates to things on the basis of the
determinate properties that they have. The determinable properties of
a thing (if there are any), are necessarily
supervenient on the determinates of the
thing, in the sense that two things that have exactly the same
determinates must also have exactly the same determinables. For
example, if two things exemplify the same determinate mass, then both
must have a mass. Armstrong (1997, p. 45) urges that this issue is
part of a more general issue as to whether necessarily supervenient
properties are anything over and above the properties on which they
supervene. His answer is that they are not; they are a "metaphysical
free lunch." He offers little argument for this claim, however, and
many philosophers would demur.
Natural Kind Properties are important properties that carve
nature at its natural joints. Paradigms include the property of being
a specific sort of elementary particle (e.g., the property of being a
neutron), chemical element (e.g., the property of being gold), and
biological species (e.g., the property of being a jackal). Natural
kinds are often contrasted with artificial kinds (e.g., being a
central processing unit).
In recent years a good deal of work has been done on the semantics of
natural kind terms (involving such issues as whether they are rigid
designators). Less work has been done on the ontology of natural
kinds, but it is clear that it is most plausible to speak of natural
kinds in those cases where something has what Locke called a real
essence (in the way that elementary particles or chemical elements
probably do). In these cases it seems plausible to suppose that
natural kind properties are
compound properties
that involve simpler properties (e.g., the quantum numbers, for
elementary particles; being made of simpler parts standing in specific
relations in the way that chemical elements are made up of atoms
related by chemical bondings).
The distinctions between natural and artificial kinds and that
between particularizing and mass properties are orthogonal to each
other. Some natural kind properties, e.g., being a dog, are
particularizing while others, e.g., gold, are not. Likewise,
some artificial properties, e.g., being a table, are
particularizing while others, e.g., furniture, are not. The
chief issue here is whether there are any natural kinds or whether our
classifications are primarily a matter of cultural and linguistic
conventions that represent just one of many ways of classifying things
(so that joints are a result of the way that we happen to carve things
up).
Some properties involve or incorporate particulars. The properties of
being identical with Harry and being in love with Harry
involve Harry. Even those who think that lots of properties exist
necessarily often believe that non-qualitative properties like this
are contingent; they depend upon Harry, and they only exist in
circumstances in which he exists. By contrast, purely qualitative
properties (like being a unit negative charge or being in
love) do not involve individuals in this way. The distinction
between properties that are purely qualitative and those that are not
is usually easy to draw in practice, but a precise characterization of
it is elusive.
A (monadic) property is an essential property of an individual just
in case that individual has the property in every possible
circumstance in which the individual exists. Essential properties are
contrasted with accidental properties, properties that things just
happen, quite contingently, to have. My car is red but it could have
been blue (had I painted it), so its color is an accidental
property. It is doubtless an essential property of my car that it is
extended, but interesting examples of essential properties are more
controversial--so controversial that some philosophers have doubted
whether there are any. It is sometimes suggested, though, that if
something is a member of a natural kind, then being a member of that
kind is essential to it; for example, being human is an
essential property of Saul Kripke.
The phrase ‘internal relation’ has been used in different ways, but
it is often used as the relational analogue of an essential (monadic)
property. For example, if a bears the relation R to
b, then R internally relates a to b just
in case a bears this relation to b in every possible
circumstance in which they both exist. Relations that are not
internal, that contingently link their relata (the things they
relate), are external. Bill and Hillary are married, but they might
not have been, so this relation between them is external. By
contrast, some philosophers have suggested that the relation being
a biological parent of is an internal relation. In every world in
which Bill and Chelsea both exist, Bill is her father. If this is
correct, then the relational property, being a child of Bill is
essential to Chelsea, but being the father of Chelsea is not
essential to Bill (he and Hillary might never have met, in which case
they would not have had Chelsea).
Some properties are instantiated by individuals because of the
relations they bear to other things. For example the property being
married is instantiated by Bill Clinton because he is married
to Hillary Clinton. Such properties are sometimes called
extrinsic or relational properties. Objects have them
because of their relations to other things. By contrast,
intrinsic or non-relational properties are properties
that a thing has quite independently of its relationships to other
things. Many properties that seem to be intrinsic turn out to be
extrinsic when we examine them carefully. The main questions here are
whether there are any interesting intrinsic properties and how the
notions of intrinsicness and extrinsicness are to be explicated.
The distinction between primary and secondary properties goes back to
the Greek atomists. It lay dormant for centuries, but was revived by
Galileo, Descartes, Boyle, Locke, and others during the seventeenth
century. Locke's influence is so pervasive that such properties still
often go under the names he gave them, primary and secondary
qualities.
The intuitive idea is that primary properties are objective features
of the world; on many accounts they are also fundamental properties
that explain why things have the other properties that they do. Early
lists of primary properties included shape, size, and
(once Newton's influence was absorbed) mass. Today we might
add properties like charge, spin or the
four-vectors of special relativity to the list of primary
properties. By contrast, secondary properties somehow depend on the
mind; standard lists of secondary properties include colors,
tastes, sounds, and smells. On Locke's account
secondary properties are powers of objects that are rooted in the
primary properties. The most pressing question about the two kinds of
properties is how (if at all) a precise and informative distinction
can be drawn between them. Issues involving primary and secondary
properties have been revived in the recent flurry of discussions of
color.
Supervenience is sometimes taken to be a relationship between two
fragments of language (e.g., between psychological vocabulary and
physical vocabulary), but it is increasingly taken to be a
relationship between pairs of families of properties. To say
that psychological properties supervene on physical properties, for
example, is to say that, necessarily, everything that has any
psychological properties also has physical properties and any two
things that have exactly the same physical properties will have
exactly the same psychological properties. There are no differences in
psychological properties without some difference in physical
properties.
There is no consensus as to how globally to construe supervenience
claims. In the case of psychological and physical properties it seems
too narrow to say that the non-relational psychological properties of
a person supervene on her non-relational physical properties (too many
important psychological properties involve relationships to things
outside the organism for this to be right). And it seems unhelpfully
narrow just to say that any two worlds that are just alike in their
distributions of physical properties will be just alike in their
distributions of psychological properties. But however we phrase the
doctrine (and no doubt different versions will be useful for different
purposes), supervenience is very naturally construed as a relation
between pairs of families of properties.
In some cases it also seems plausible to think of the supervenient
realm as linguistic and the supporting, subvenient realm in terms of
properties: there can be no difference in truths in the upper realm
(e.g., those employing psychological vocabulary) without a difference
in properties (e.g., physical properties) at the lower level. But this
hybrid approach has not received much attention.
We might arrive at a notion of fictional properties in the
following way. In Naming and Necessity Kripke discusses what he
calls ‘mythical species’ (1980, pp. 156-158). On Kripke's view,
‘Sherlock Holmes’ does not denote anyone, neither an actual individual
or a merely possible one. The name fails to denote because all our
descriptions of Holmes are essentially incomplete. They do not fully
specify a unique person (not even a unique merely possible person),
and so there are many different possible detectives who have all of
the properties ascribed to Holmes but who differ in other ways. No one
of them has any more claim on being Holmes than any of the rest, and
so there are no counterfactual situations that could correctly be
described as ones in which Holmes exists.
The properties ascribed to unicorns are similarly incomplete. There
are many different possible species that have the properties we
commonly ascribe to unicorns but which differ in other ways. No one of
these species has any more claim on being unicorns than any of the
rest, and so there are no counterfactual situations that could
correctly be described as ones in which unicorns exists. It may also
be the case, though Kripke doesn't discuss the matter, that notions
like phlogiston and caloric fluid are similarly incomplete, and that
there are no counterfactual situations that could correctly be
described as ones in which anything has the property of being
phlogiston or that of being caloric fluid. But even if this
further claim isn't true, Kripke's example of unicorns suggests that
there may be a distinction between actual properties and fictional
properties. There are interesting philosophical issues about fictional
characters, individuals like Holmes and Pegasus and the bride of
Frankenstein, and there may be similarly interesting questions about
fictional properties. Aside from Zalta (1983), however, little work
has been done on this topic.
In this section I will explain some of the most rudimentary ideas
behind several recent formal theories of properties. The aim is to
convey the intuitive flavor of this work, so I will proceed primarily
by example rather than with definitions and proofs (interested readers
can find plenty of both in the works cited below).
There are several important choices that must be made in devising a
formal theory of properties; they include the following:
- Should the account be developed as a formal theory in a familiar
logic (in the way set theories are now standardly axiomatized in
standard first-order logic)? This was the approach in the early formal
theories of Barcan-Marcus (1963) and Lemmon (1963), who used
first-order modal logic (see Jubien, 1989, for a recent, more
sophisticated (and non-modal) implementation of this approach).
Alternatively, should a formal account of properties be developed as a
richer "logic of properties" (e.g., Bealer, 1982; Zalta, 1983; Menzel,
1993; Swoyer, 1998)?
- Should we employ a typed or an untyped conception of properties
(the latter is much more flexible, but it must be handled with care to
avoid paradox)?
- Should we make provisions for complex predicates (or complex
singular terms, or both) with something akin to a logical structure?
- Should we require all of the expressions in the syntactic
categories that can denote (or express) properties to do so or should
we allow some or all of them not to?
Different choices are recommended by different conceptions of
properties. For the sake of exposition I will begin with those choices
that minimize the departures from familiar logical systems like
non-modal first-order logic. This means a logic of properties that is
typed, that does not include complex properties, and in which every
predicate expresses a property. We will then see how to extend this
approach in various ways.
Think of your favorite formulation of first-order logic with
identity. Then just add n-place predicate variables (for all
positive integers n) to its syntax and count any n-place
predicate variable followed by n individual terms (i.e., by
individual variables and constants) as a formula. Finally, allow
n-place predicate variables to be bound by quantifiers
containing an n-place predicate variable (in just the same way
that individual variables can be), and count formulas with no free
variables as sentences. For example, the expression
‘X3abc’ is a formula consisting of the
three-place predicate variable ‘X3’ followed by the
three individual terms ‘a’, ‘b’, and ‘c’; since
the predicate variable is unbound, this formula is not a sentence. By
contrast,
‘(
X2)X2ab’
is a sentence (here ‘’ is the existential
quantifier; this sentence says that there is at least one two-place
relation that relates a to b or, more idiomatically,
that a stands in some binary relation to b).
We interpret languages in this logical system over Intensional Relational
Structures (IRSs). An IRS is an ordered triple:
I = < DI,
DP,
ext >,
where DI and
DP are non-empty,
non-overlapping sets. On intended interpretations (which we will take
for granted here) DI is the
domain of individuals and DP
is the domain of properties (including relations).
DP is in turn the union of an
infinite number of non-overlapping, non-empty sets:
1DP
(the set of one-place properties),
2DP
(the set of two-place relations),
3DP
(the set of three-place relations),
and so on for each positive integer n.
Finally, ext is an extension assignment function;
it assigns an extension to every property in the property domain
DP in accordance with the
following rule:
Where Pn is an n-place property,
ext assigns Pn a (possibly empty) set
of ordered n-tuples whose members are drawn from the individual
domain DI
(we take an ordered one-tuple whose member is a to be a
itself). Hence, the extension assignment assigns each one-place
property a subset of the individual domain, each two-place property
(i.e., each binary relation) a set of ordered pairs on individuals,
and so on. In other words, it assigns exactly the same sorts of
extensions to n-place properties that interpretations in
standard first-order logic assign to n-place predicates.
Finally, a model or
interpretation on an IRS interprets our formal language
over it. It assigns a denotation to each individual constant (exactly
as in standard first-order logic) and an n-place property to
each n-place predicate (here we go beyond standard first-order
logic). The fundamental idea is just that:
- An atomic sentence like ‘F1a’, is
true in the model just in case the object denoted by ‘a’
is in the extension of the property denoted by ‘F1’,
- An atomic sentence like ‘F2ab’, is
true in the model just in case the ordered pair containing the
objects denoted by ‘a’ and ‘b’ (in that order) is in the
extension of the (two-place) property denoted by
‘F2’,
- ...and so
on.1
As in first-order logic, we must add variable assignments (or their
equivalents) to explain the workings of quantifiers. A variable
assignment assigns an object of the appropriate sort to each variable
of the language (it assigns individuals to individual variables,
one-place properties to one-place predicate variables, two-place
properties (binary relations) to two-place predicate variables, and so
on). We then define satisfaction conditions for formulas (in a model
and relative to a variable assignment) just as we do in standard
first-order logic. Finally, a formula is true in a model just in case
it contains no unbound variables and is satisfied by every variable
assignment with respect to the model; a sentence is valid if is true
in all models; and a set of sentences entails a sentence if that
sentence is true in every model in which all of the sentences in the
set are true. It is routine to extend such logics to higher orders,
so that first-level properties can have second-level properties and
stand in second-order relations, and so on up.
Philosophers, linguists, and computer scientists have increasingly
chafed under the inflexible aspects of typed theories, and several
recent accounts treat properties as individuals that are included in
the range of the quantifiers for ordinary individuals. One way to
accommodate this approach is to modify IRSs so that they
include just a single domain that contains both properties and
individuals. We then introduce n-place property-designating
singular terms and require that an interpretation assign them
denotations of the appropriate sort. For example, a one-place term of
this sort might be used to represent the word ‘honesty’, and a
three-place term of this sort might be used to represent ‘betweeness’.
We can still allow predicates to denote properties (or we can
introduce a new semantic relation, expression, which assigns
properties to predicates). This allows something akin to self
predication; if ‘F’ denotes (or expresses) the same property
that the one-place singular term ‘a’ denotes, then ‘Fa’
will be true just in case the property denoted by ‘a’ is in the
extension of itself. Quite intricate variations on this basic theme
are possible; the most detailed is Bealer's (1982) first-order
intensional logic that includes intensional abstracts among its
singular terms.
It is much easier to deal with some features of natural language if
we include complex predicates in our language and introduce a
systematic way of interpreting them over IRSs. In the 1970s it
occurred to several people that a rigorous formal system embodying
this conception of properties could be constructed by investing the
operations on linguistic expression in systems like Quine's predicate
functor logic (1960) with an extra-linguistic, ontological status
(e.g., Bealer, 1973, 1982; McMichael & Zalta, 1981; Leeds, 1978).
Adding the machinery necessary to accommodate all of the complex
predicates we might want is quite intricate (see Zalta, 1983 for a
very readable account), and here I will just mention two examples to
convey the general idea.
The first step is to introduce a variable-binding operator,
, that allows us to construct complex
predicates from open formulas. For example, we can apply
‘’ to
the open formula, ‘Rx & Sx’ to form the
one-place complex predicate
‘[x (Rx & Sx)]’;
if ‘R’ denotes being red and ‘S’ denotes being
square, then this complex predicate denotes the compound,
conjunctive property being red and square (a stilted, but
sometimes useful rendering of this is ‘the property of being a thing
that is both red and square’). Similarly, we can apply the operator
to the open formula
‘y(Lxy)’ to form the one-place
predicate
‘[x
y(Lxy)]’;
if ‘L’ stands for loves, this complex predicate
denotes the compound property loving someone (whereas
‘[y
x(Lxy)]’
would denote being loved
by someone).2
Although the guiding ideas here are relatively straightforward,
considerable delicacy is required to ensure that everything works out
in precisely the right way. For example, an object should exemplify
the conjunctive property denoted by
‘[x (Rx & Sx)]’
if and only if it exemplifies both the properties R and
S. And an object should exemplify the property denoted by
‘[y
x(Lxy]’
just in case it loves some object (and just in case it does not
exemplify the property denoted by
‘[y ~x(Lxy]’).
There are many systematic connections of this sort among complex
predicates, compound properties, and the things that exemplify them,
and some fairly heavy machinery is required to ensure that things work
smoothly for properties of arbitrarily complexity. (Consider, for
example, [xyz
w(Fxyw & ~(Gy or
v(Hzvy)))].)
One way to make all of this work as it should is to add operations to
IRSs that allow us to "build" compound properties up out of
simpler ones. For example, to accommodate conjunctive properties we
introduce an operation, &, that maps each pair of
properties, P and Q (having the same number of argument
places, though this restriction can be dropped at a slight cost of
simplicity) to the conjunctive property P & Q. To
ensure that things work properly we must also add a clause
specifying how the &-operation interacts with the extension
assignment function. In particular, we require that
ext(P & Q) be the intersection of
ext(P) and ext(Q).
By adding a handful of additional "property-building" operations
(corresponding to the various connectives, quantifiers, operations on
relations like conversion, and the syntactic operation of
substitution), clauses specifying how each operation interlocks with
the extension assignment, and a recursive definition of the
denotations of predicates, we can ensure that complex predicates
denote properties that behave as they should (Zalta, 1983 contains an
elegant account of one way to do this; Swoyer, 1998 contains a
slightly different approach in which assignments of denotations to
complex predicates and assignments of extensions to the properties
they denote are both treated as homomorphisms). With such a rich
stock of properties we can add a comprehension schema to our logic
which tells us that each condition (open formula) determines a
property, i.e., there is at least one property that an ordered group
of things has just in case the open formula is true of
them.3
It is also possible to add complex singular terms to the language;
these are formal counterparts of nominalizations like being poor
but happy. We can then set up the semantics so that these abstract
singular terms denote compound properties.
Some realists hold that it is an empirical question just which
properties there are. On this view, there can be no logical or a
priori existence conditions for properties. It is possible to
formulate a very minimal logic (Swoyer, 1993; 1998) that fits nicely
with this conception. Because it is so minimal, it has a
philosophical neutrality that provides a framework in which various
richer theories of properties (including ones with complex predicates)
can be formulated, classified, and compared.
There are two ways to view the kinds of formal systems described in
this section (whether we call them ‘logics’ or not). We can view them
as attempts to tell the One True Story about an abstract realm of
properties (or the One True Story about the logical structure
underlying a natural language like English or Hindi). On this
construal the various systems are competitors. But it is also
possible to view such formal systems in a more prosaic way, as
abstract models that allow us to represent and reason about various
phenomena involving properties (including various fragments of
English). On this picture, such systems are similar in important
respects to formal models in the sciences. They always involve
simplifications and idealizations, and different models are useful for
different purposes. Moreover, if a simpler model is enough to handle
the phenomenon we are interested, it is overkill to employ more
complex models even if they are available.
Various combinations of the features discussed in this section are
possible. At this point several extensions also seem desirable,
including allowing multigrade predicates like ‘had a knock-down,
drag-out fight with each other’ and
multigrade properties.
It is also important to extend current accounts to deal with
vagueness, and it would be gratifying to see them make contact with
recent empirical work on concepts and categorization.
There has been some discussion of complex or structural properties in
the recent literature, and certainly the metaphor of
relation-building operations
(like &) may suggest that some properties literally have
parts. This idea can be traced back to Plato's later dialogues, where
he speaks of one Form being part of another (Sophist, 257d). It
has been defended recently by Armstrong (1978, pp. 36-39, pp. 67f) and
Bigelow and Pargetter (1989). This view may have some plausibility
for certain sorts of properties, e.g., conjunctive properties. But the
general view (which these philosophers do not endorse) that properties
literally have logical structures that mirror the syntactic structures
of the complex predicates that denote them is less appealing. In the
case of a negative property, for example, it would require us to think
that the property F is somehow part of the negative property,
being a non-F.
On an alternative view, the appearance that some properties are
literally structured is an artifact of our use of structured terms
(complex, -predicates like
‘[x (Rx & Sx)]’)
to denote them. But our use of structured terms and structural
metaphors doesn't mean that the properties themselves are genuinely
structured or that they literally have parts. There is a difference
between structured specifications, which we do employ, and
specifications of structure, which is another matter entirely.
There are logical relations among properties; being F
and being not F are inconsistent (in the sense that nothing
could exemplify both at once); being F and G entails being
F (in the sense that anything exemplifying the former property
must also exemplify the latter). These logical relations do structure
the realm of properties. This makes a structured specification a
natural device for singling out a member of this structured realm of
entities, since it identifies it by its place--its logical
location--in that domain. But the role of the syntactic structure of a
complex predicate is not to exhibit the internal structure of a
property; it is to disclose that property's niche in the logical
network of properties. We should add the cautionary note that a
picture of compound properties needn't be a package deal. It is
possible to argue that there are no compound properties, that there
are some but not others (e.g., there might be conjunctive, but no
disjunctive, properties), or that there is a multitude of them. Which
view is correct? That is a philosophical question, and formal work
alone cannot answer it.
- Achinstein, Peter (1974) "The Identity Conditions of Properties,"
American Philosophical Quarterly, 11; 257-275
- Armstrong, David (1978) Universals and Scientific Realism, Vol.
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Frege, Gottlob: logic, theorem, and foundations for arithmetic |
propositional function |
Russell’s paradox |
tropes |
universals: the medieval problem of |
vagueness
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