M
=
{v
H |
uM(<v,u> = 0)}.
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At its core, quantum mechanics can be regarded as a non-classical probability calculus resting upon a non-classical propositional logic. More specifically, in quantum mechanics each probability-bearing proposition of the form "the value of physical quantity A lies in the range B" is represented by a projection operator on a Hilbert space H. These form a non-Boolean -- in particular, non-distributive -- orthocomplemented lattice. Quantum-mechanical states correspond exactly to probability measures (suitably defined) on this lattice.
What are we to make of this? Some have argued that the empirical success of quantum mechanics calls for a revolution in logic itself. This view is associated with the demand for a realistic interpretation of quantum mechanics, i.e., one not grounded in any primitive notion of measurement. Against this, there is a long tradition of interpreting quantum mechanics operationally, that is, as being precisely a theory of measurement. On this latter view, it is not surprising that a "logic" of measurement-outcomes, in a setting where not all measurements are compatible, should prove not to be Boolean. Rather, the mystery is why it should have the particular non-Boolean structure that it does in quantum mechanics. A substantial literature has grown up around the programme of giving some independent motivation for this structure -- ideally, by deriving it from more primitive and plausible axioms governing a generalized probability theory.
It is uncontroversial (though remarkable) that the formal apparatus of quantum mechanics reduces neatly to a generalization of classical probability in which the role played by a Boolean algebra of events in the latter is taken over by the "quantum logic" of projection operators on a Hilbert space.[1] Moreover, the usual statistical interpretation of quantum mechanics asks us to take this generalized quantum probability theory quite literally -- that is, not as merely a formal analogue of its classical counterpart, but as a genuine doctrine of chances. In this section, I survey this quantum probability theory and its supporting quantum logic.[2]
[For further background on Hilbert spaces, see Supplement 1: The Basic Theory of Hilbert Spaces. For further background on ordered sets and lattices, see Supplement 2: The Basic Theory of Ordering Relations. Concepts and results explained these supplements will be used freely in what follows.]
… the relation between the properties of a physical system on the one hand, and the projections on the other, makes possible a sort of logical calculus with these. However, in contrast to the concepts of ordinary logic, this system is extended by the concept of "simultaneous decidability" which is characteristic for quantum mechanics [1932, p. 253].
Let's examine this "logical calculus" of projections. Ordered by set-inclusion, the closed subspaces of H form a complete lattice, in which the meet (greatest lower bound) of a set of subspaces is their intersection, while their join (least upper bound) is the closed span of their union. Since a typical closed subspace has infinitely many complementary closed subspaces, this lattice is not distributive; however, it is orthocomplemented by the mapping
MIn view of the above-mentioned one-one correspondence between closed subspaces and projections, we may impose upon the set L(H) the structure of a complete orthocomplemented lattice, defining P
Q, where
ran(P) 
ran(Q) and
P
=
1 
P
(so that ran(P) =
ran(P)).
It is straightforward that
PQ
just in case PQ = QP = P. More generally, if PQ =
QP, then PQ =
P
Q,
the meet of P and Q in
L(H); also in this case their join is given
by
P
Q =
P+Q PQ.
1.1 Lemma:
Let P and Q be projection operators on the Hilbert space H. The following are equivalent:
- PQ = QP
- The sublattice of L(H) generated by P, Q, P
- P, Q lie in a common Boolean sub-ortholattice of L(H).
Adhering to the idea that commuting observables -- in particular, projections -- are simultaneously measurable, we conclude that the members of a Boolean "block" (that is, a Boolean sub-ortholattice) of L(H) are simultaneously testable. This suggests that we can maintain a classical logical interpretation of the meet, join and orthocomplement as applied to commuting projections.
Q iff
P Q.
Note that
PQ
iff PQ = QP = 0.
If P and Q are orthogonal projections, then
their join is simply their sum; traditionally, this is denoted
P
Q.
We denote the identity mapping on H by 1.
1.2 Definition:
A (countably additive) probability measure on L(H) is a mapping: L
i
Here is one way in which we can manufacture a probability measure on
L(H). Let u be a unit vector of
H, and set
u(P) =
<Pu,u>. This gives the usual
quantum-mechanical recipe for the probability that P will
have value 1 in the state u. Note that we can also express
u as
u(P) =
Tr(P Pu), where
Pu is the one-dimensional projection
associated with the unit vector u.
More generally, if
i, i=1,2,…, are
probability measures on L(H), then so is any
"mixture", or convex combination
=
i
tii
where
0ti1
and
i ti =
1. Given any sequence u1,
u2,…, of unit vectors, let
i =
ui and let
Pi =
Pui. Forming the
operator
W = t1P1 + t2P2 + … ,one sees that
An operator expressible in this way as a convex combination of one-dimensional projections in is called a density operator. Thus, every density operator W gives rise to a countably additive probability measure on L(H). The following striking converse, due to A. Gleason [1957], shows that the theory of probability measures on L(H) is co-extensive with the theory of (mixed) quantum mechanical states on H:
1.3 Gleason's Theorem:
Let H have dimension > 2. Then every countably additive probability measure on L(H) has the form
An important consequence of Gleason's Theorem is that
L(H) does not admit any probability
measures having only the values 0 and 1. To see this, note that for
any density operator W, the mapping u
<Wu,u> is continuous
on the unit sphere of H. But since the latter is
connected, no continuous function on it can take only the two values
0 and 1. This result is often taken to rule out the possibility of
‘hidden variables’ -- an issue taken up in more detail in
section 6.
The reduction of QM to probability theory based on L(H) is mathematically compelling, but what does it tell us about QM --- or, assuming QM to be a correct and complete physical theory, about the world? How, in other words, are we to interpret the quantum logic L(H)? The answer will turn on how we unpack the phrase, freely used above,
(*) The value of the observable A lies in the range B.
One possible reading of (*) is operational: "measurement of the observable A would yield (or will yield, or has yielded) a value in the set B ". On this view, projections represent statements about the possible results of measurements. This sits badly with realists of a certain stripe, who, shunning reference to ‘measurement’, prefer to understand (*) as a property ascription: "the system has a certain categorical property, which corresponds to the observable A having, independently of any measurement, a value in the set B". (One must be careful in how one understands this last phrase, however: construed incautiously, it seems to posit a hidden-variables interpretation of quantum mechanics of just the sort ruled out by Gleason's Theorem. I will have more to say about this below.)
Whereas logicians have usually assumed that properties … of negation were the ones least able to withstand a critical analysis, the study of mechanics points to the distributive identities … as the weakest link in the algebra of logic. [1937, p. 839]
In the 1960s and early 1970s, this thesis was advanced rather more aggressively by a number of authors, including especially David Finkelstein and Hilary Putnam, who argued that quantum mechanics requires a revolution in our understanding of logic per se. According to Putnam [1968], “Logic is as empirical as geometry. … We live in a world with a non-classical logic.”
For Putnam, the elements of L(H) represent categorical properties that an object possesses, or does not, independently of whether or not we look. Inasmuch as this picture of physical properties is confirmed by the empirical success of quantum mechanics, we must, on this view, accept that the way in which physical properties actually hang together is not Boolean. Since logic is, for Putnam, very much the study of how physical properties actually hang together, he concludes that classical logic is simply mistaken: the distributive law is not universally valid.
Classically, if S is the set of states of a physical system,
then every subset of S corresponds to a categorical
property of the system, and vice versa. In quantum mechanics, the
state space is the (projective) unit sphere S =
S(H) of a Hilbert space. However, not all
subsets of S correspond to quantum-mechanical properties of
the system. The latter correspond only to subsets of the special form
S 
M, for
M a closed linear subspace of H. In
particular, only subsets of this form are assigned probabilities. This
leaves us with two options. One is to take only these special
properties as ‘real’ (or ‘physical’, or
‘meaningful’), regarding more general subsets of S
as corresponding to no real categorical properties at all. The other
is to regard the ‘quantum’ properties as a small subset of
the set of all physically (or at any rate, metaphysically) reasonable,
but not necessarily observable, properties of the system. On
this latter view, the set of all properties of a physical
system is entirely classical in its logical structure, but we decline
to assign probabilities to the non-observable
properties.[3]
This second position, while certainly not inconsistent with realism per se, turns upon a distinction involving a notion of "observation", "measurement", "test", or something of this sort -- a notion that realists are often at pains to avoid in connection with fundamental physical theory. Of course, any realist account of a statistical physical theory such as quantum mechanics will ultimately have to render up some explanation of how measurements are supposed to take place. That is, it will have to give an account of which physical interactions between "object" and "probe" systems count as measurements, and of how these interactions cause the probe system to evolve into final ‘outcome-states’ that correspond to -- and have the same probabilities as -- the outcomes predicted by the theory. This is the notorious measurement problem.
In fact, Putnam advanced his version of quantum-logical realism as offering a (radical) dissolution of the measurement problem: According to Putnam, the measurement problem (and indeed every other quantum-mechanical "paradox") arises through an improper application of the distributive law, and hence disappears once this is recognized. This proposal, however, is widely regarded as mistaken.
As mentioned above, realist interpretations of quantum mechanics must be careful in how they construe the phrase "the observable A has a value in the set B". The simplest and most traditional proposal -- often dubbed the "eigenstate-eigenvalue link" (Fine 1973) -- is that (*) holds if and only if a measurement of A yields a value in the set B with certainty, i.e., with (quantum-mechanical!) probability 1. While this certainly gives a realist interpretation of (*)[4], it does not provide a solution to the measurement problem. Indeed, we can use it to give a sharp formulation of that problem: even though A is certain to yield a value in B when measured, unless the quantum state is an eigenstate of the measured observable A, the system does not possess any categorical property corresponding to A's having a specific value in the set B. Putnam seems to assume that a realist interpretation of (*) should consist in assigning to A some unknown value within B, for which quantum mechanics yields a non-trivial probability. However, an attempt to make such assignments simultaneously for all observables runs afoul of Gleason's Theorem.[5]
This is hardly the last word, however. Having accepted all of the above, there still remains the question of why the logic of measurement outcomes should have the very special form L(H), and never anything more general.[6] This question entertains the idea that the formal structure of quantum mechanics may be uniquely determined by a small number of reasonable assumptions, together perhaps with certain manifest regularities in the observed phenomena. This possibility is already contemplated in von Neumann's Grundlagen (and also his later work in continuous geometry), but first becomes explicit -- and programmatic -- in the work of George Mackey [1957, 1963]. Mackey presents a sequence of six axioms, framing a very conservative generalized probability theory, that underwrite the construction of a ‘logic’ of experimental propositions, or, in his terminology, ‘questions’, having the structure of a sigma-orthomodular poset. The outstanding problem, for Mackey, was to explain why this poset ought to be isomorphic to L(H):
Almost all modern quantum mechanics is based implicitly or explicitly on the following assumption, which we shall state as an axiom:Axiom VII: The partially ordered set of all questions in quantum mechanics is isomorphic to the partially ordered set of all closed subspaces of a separable, infinite dimensional Hilbert space.This axiom has rather a different character from Axioms I through VI. These all had some degree of physical naturalness and plausibility. Axiom VII seems entirely ad hoc. Why do we make it? Can we justify making it? … Ideally, one would like to have a list of physically plausible assumptions from which one could deduce Axiom VII. Short of this one would like a list from which one could deduce a set of possibilities for the structure … all but one of which could be shown to be inconsistent with suitably planned experiments. [19, pp. 71-72]
Since Mackey's writing there has grown up an extensive technical literature exploring variations on his axiomatic framework in an effort to supply the missing assumptions. The remainder of this article presents a brief survey of the current state of this project.
: E
[0,1]
summing to 1 over
E.[8]
Notice that the set
(E)
of all probability weights on E is convex, in that,
given any sequence
1,2,…
of probability weights and any sequence
t1,t2,…
of non-negative real numbers summing to one, the convex sum or
‘mixture’
t11 +
t22 +
… (taken pointwise on E) is again a probability weight. The
extreme points of this convex set are exactly the "point-masses"
(x) associated with the
outcomes x
E:
Thus,
(E) is a simplex: each point
(E)
is representable in a unique way as a convex combination of extreme
points, namely:
We need also to recall the concept of a random variable. If
E is an outcome set and V, some set of
‘values’ (real numbers, pointer-readings, or what not), a
V-valued random variable is simply a mapping
f : E
V.
The heuristic (but it need only be taken as that) is that one
‘measures’ the random variable f by
‘performing’ the experiment represented by E and,
upon obtaining the outcome x
E, recording f(x) as the measured
value. Note that if V is a set of real numbers, or, more
generally, a subset of a vector space, we may define the expected
value of f in a state
(E) by:
E(f,E f(x)
is called a test. The set
X =
of
all outcomes of all tests belonging to
is called the outcome space of
.
Notice that we allow distinct tests to overlap, i.e., to have
outcomes in
common.[9]
If is a
test space with outcome-space
X, a state on
is a mapping : X
[0,1]
such that
xE
(x)
= 1 for every test E
.
Thus, a state is a consistent assignment of a probability weight to
each test -- consistent in that, where two distinct tests share a
common outcome, the state assigns that outcome the same probability
whether it is secured as a result of one test or the other. (This may
be regarded as a normative requirement on the outcome-identifications
implicit in the structure of
:
if outcomes of two tests are not equiprobable in all states, they
ought not to be identified.) The set of all states on
is denoted by
().
This is a convex set, but in contrast to the situation in discrete
classical probability theory, it is generally not a simplex.
The concept of a random variable admits several generalizations to the
setting of test spaces. Let us agree that a simple (real-valued) random
variable on a test space
is a mapping
f : E
R
where E is a test in
.
We define the expected value of
f in a state
()
in the obvious way, namely, as the expected value of
f with respect to the probability
weight obtained by restricting
to E (provided, of course, that this expected value
exists). One can go on to define more general classes of random
variables by taking suitable limits (for details, see [Younce,
1987]).
In classical probability theory (and especially in classical
statistics) one usually focuses, not on the set of all possible
probability weights, but on some designated subset of these (e.g.,
those belonging to a given family of distributions).
Accordingly, by a probabilistic model, I mean pair
(,)
consisting of a test space
and a designated set of states
() on
.
I'll refer to
as the test space and to
as the state space of the model.
I'll now indicate how this framework can accommodate both the usual measure-theoretic formalism of full-blown classical probability theory and the Hilbert-space formalism of quantum probability theory.
be a sigma-field
of subsets of S. We can regard each partition E of
S into countably many pair-wise disjoint -measurable subsets as representing a
‘coarse-grained’ approximation to an imagined perfect
experiment that would reveal the state of the system. Let
be the test space consisting of all such
partitions. Note that the outcome set for
is the set X = B
{Ø} of non-empty -measurable subsets of
S. Evidently, the probability weights on
correspond exactly
to the countably additive probability measures on
.
denote the collection of (unordered) orthonormal bases of
H. Thus, the outcome-space X of
will be the unit sphere of H. Note that if
u is any unit vector of H and
E
is any orthonormal basis, we have
Thus, each unit vector of H determines a probability
weight on
.
Quantum mechanics asks us to take this literally: any
‘maximal’ discrete quantum-mechanical observable is modeled
by an orthonormal basis, and any pure quantum mechanical state, by a
unit vector in exactly this way. Conversely, every orthonormal basis
and every unit vector are understood to correspond to such a
measurement and such a state.
Gleason's theorem can now be invoked to identify the states on
with the density operators on H: to each state
in
(H)
there corresponds a unique density operator W such that,
for every unit vector x of H,
(x) = <Wx,x> =
Tr(WPx),
Px being the one-dimensional projection
associated with x. Conversely, of course, every such density
operator defines a unique state by the formula above. We can
also represent simple real-valued random variables
operator-theoretically. Each bounded simple random variable
f gives rise to a bounded self-adjoint operator
A =
xE
f(x)Px. The spectral
theorem tells us that every self-adjoint operator on
H can be obtained by taking suitable limits of
operators of this form.
,)
are several partially ordered sets, each of which has some claim to
the status of an ‘empirical logic’ associated with the
model. In this section, I'll discuss two: the so-called
operational logic
()
and the property lattice
L(,).
Under relatively benign conditions on
,
the former is an orthoalgebra. The latter is always a
complete lattice, and under plausible further assumptions,
atomic. Moreover, there is a natural order preserving mapping from
to
L. This is not generally an order-isomorphism, but
when it is, we obtain a complete orthomodular lattice, and thus come a
step closer to the projection lattice of a Hilbert
space.
is a test space, an
-event is a set of
-outcomes that is
contained in some test. In other words, an
-event is simply an event in the classical
sense for any one of the tests comprising
.
Now, if A and B are two
-events,
we say that A and B are orthogonal, and
write
AB,
if they are disjoint and their union is again an event. We say that
two orthogonal events are complements of one another if their
union is a test. We say that events
A and B are perspective, and write
A~B, if they share any common complement. (Notice
that any two tests E and F are perspective, since
they are both complementary to the empty event.)
4.1 Definition:
A test space
While it is possible to construct perfectly plausible examples of test
spaces that are not algebraic, most test spaces that one encounters
‘in nature’ -- including the Borel and quantum test spaces
described in the preceding section -- do seem to enjoy this
property. The more important point is that, as an axiom, algebraicity
is relatively benign, in the sense that many test spaces can be
‘completed’ to become algebraic. In particular, if every
outcome has probability greater than .5 in at least one state, then
is contained in an algebraic test space
having the same outcomes and
the same states as
. (See [Gudder, 1985] for details).
Suppose now that
is algebraic. It is easy to see that the relation ~
of perspectivity is then an equivalence relation on the set of
-events.
More than this, if
is algebraic, then ~ is a congruence for
the partial binary operation of forming unions of orthogonal events:
in other words,
A~B and
BC imply that
AC ~
BC for all
-events A,
B, and C.
Let ()
be the set of equivalence classes of
-events under perspectivity,
and denote the equivalence class of an event
A by p(A); we then have a natural partial
binary operation on
()
defined by
p(A)p(B)
= p(AB) for orthogonal
events A and B. Setting
0 := p(Ø) and 1 := p(E), E
any member of
, we
obtain a partial-algebraic structure
((),,0,1),
called the logic of
. This
satisfies the following conditions:
is associative and
commutative:
(bc)
is defined, so is
(ab)c,
and the two are equal
b
is defined, so is ba,
and the two are equal.
a = a, for every
a L
L,
there exists a unique a
L
with
aa = 1
a
exists only if a = 0
4.2 Definition:
A structure (L,
Thus, the logic of an algebraic test space is an orthoalgebra. One can
show that, conversely, every orthoalgebra arises as the logic
()
of an algebraic test space
(Golfin [1988]). Note that non-isomorphic test spaces can have
isomorphic logics.
b
iff b =
ac
for some
ca.
Relative to this ordering, the mapping
aa
is an orthocomplementation and
ab
iff
ab.
It can be shown that
ab
is always a minimal upper bound for a and b, but it
is generally not the least upper bound. Indeed, we have the
following [ref]:
4.3 Lemma:
For an orthoalgebra (L,
- a
- If a
- The orthoposet (L,
An orthoalgebra satisfying condition (b) is said to be
orthocoherent. In other words: an orthoalgebra is
ortho-coherent if and only if finite pair-wise summable subsets of
L are jointly summable. The lemma tells us that every
orthocoherent orthoalgebra is, inter alia, an orthomodular
poset. Conversely, an orthocomplemented poset is orthomodular iff
ab =
ab is defined for all pairs with
ab and the
resulting partial binary operation is associative -- in which case the
resulting structure
(L,,0,1)
is an orthocoherent orthoalgebra, the canonical ordering on which
agrees with the given ordering on L. Thus,
orthomodular posets (the framework for Mackey's version of
quantum logic) are equivalent to orthocoherent orthoalgebras.
Some version of orthocoherence was taken by Mackey and many of his successors as an axiom. (It appears, in an infinitary form, as Mackey's axiom V; a related but stronger condition appears in the definition of a partial Boolean algebra in the work of Kochen and Specker [1965].) However, it is quite easy to construct simple model test spaces, having perfectly straightforward -- even classical -- interpretations, the logics of which are not orthocoherent. As far as I know, there has never been given any entirely compelling reason for regarding orthocoherence as an essential feature of all reasonable physical models. Moreover, certain apparently quite well-motivated constructions that one wants to perform with test spaces tend to destroy orthocoherence (see Section 7).
,),
and the system's states are identified with the probability
weights in . Classically, any subset
of the state-space
corresponds to a categorical property of the system. However, in
quantum mechanics, and indeed even classically, not every such
property will be testable (or "physical"). (In quantum mechanics, only
subsets of the state-space corresponding to closed subspaces of the
Hilbert space are testable; in classical mechanics, one usually takes
only, e.g., Borel sets to correspond to testable properties: the
difference is that the testable properties in the latter case happen
still to form a Boolean algebra of sets, where in the former case,
they do not.)
One way to frame this distinction is as follows. The support
of a set of states
is the set
S(
of outcomes that are possible when the property
obtains. There is a sense in which two properties are empirically
indistinguishable if they have the same support: we cannot distinguish
between them by means of a single execution of a single test. We might
therefore wish to identify physical properties with classes of
physically indistinguishable classical properties, or, equivalently,
with their associated supports. However, if we wish to adhere to the
programme of representing physical properties as subsets (rather than
as equivalence-classes of subsets) of the state-space, we can do so,
as follows. Define a mapping
F :
(X)
()
by F(J) =
{ |
S() J }.
The mapping
F(S()) is then a closure
operator on (), and the
collection of closed sets (that is, the range of F) is a
complete lattice of sets, closed under arbitrary
intersection.[11]
Evidently, classical properties -- subsets of
-- have the same support iff they have the same
closure, so we may identify physical properties with closed subsets of
the state-space:
4.4 Definition:
The property lattice of the model (
We now have two different ‘logics’ associated with an entity
(,)
with
algebraic: a ‘logic’
()
of experimental propositions that is an orthoalgebra, but generally
not a lattice, and a ‘logic’
L(,)
of properties that is a complete lattice, but rarely
orthocomplemented in any natural way (Randall and Foulis, 1983). The
two are connected by a natural mapping
[ ] : L,
given by p
[p] =
F(Jp)
where for each p,
Jp
=
{x X |
p(x)
p }.
That is,
Jp is the set of outcomes that are consistent
with p, and [p] is the largest (i.e., weakest)
physical property making p certain to be confirmed if
tested.
The mapping p
[p]
is order preserving. For both the classical and quantum-mechanical
models considered above, it is in fact an order-isomorphism. Note that
whenever this is the case,
will inherit from
L
the structure of a complete lattice, which will then automatically be
orthomodular by Lemma 4.3. In other words, in such cases we have only
one logic, which is a complete orthomodular lattice. While it
is surely too much to expect that every conceivable physical
system should enjoy this property -- indeed, we can easily construct
toy examples to the contrary -- the condition is at least reasonably
transparent in its
meaning.
The answer is: without additional assumptions, not very. The lattice
L(H) has several quite special
order-theoretic features. First it is atomic -- every element
is the join of minimal non-zero elements (i.e., one-dimensional
subspaces). Second, it is irreducible -- it can not be
expressed as a non-trivial direct product of simpler
OMLs.[13]
Finally, and most significantly,
it satisfies the so-called atomic covering law: if
p
L(H) is an atom and
p q, then
p q
covers q (no element of
L(H) lies strictly between
p q and
q).
These properties do not quite suffice to capture
L(H), but they do get us into
the right ballpark. Let V be any inner product space
over an involutive division ring
D. A subspace M of V is
said to be -closed iff
M =
M,
where M =
{vV |
mM(
<v,m> = 0)}. Ordered by set-inclusion, the
collection L(V)
of all -closed subspaces of V
forms a complete atomic lattice, orthocomplemented by the mapping
M
M. A theorem of
Amemiya and Araki [1965] shows that a real, complex or quaternionic
inner product space V with
L(V) orthomodular, is necessarily
complete. For this reason, an inner product space V
over an involutive division ring is called a generalized Hilbert
space if its lattice of closed subspaces
L(V) is orthomodular. The following
representation theorem is due to C. Piron [1964]:
5.1 Theorem:
Let L be a complete, atomic, irreducible orthomodular lattice satisfying the atomic covering law. If L contains at least 4 orthogonal atoms, then there exists an involutive division ring D and an inner-product space V over D such that L is isomorphic to L(V).
It should be noted that generalized Hilbert spaces have been constructed over fairly exotic division rings.[14] Thus, while it brings us tantalizingly close, Piron's theorem does not quite bring us all the way back to orthodox quantum mechanics.
The covering law presents a more delicate problem. While it is
probably safe to say that no simple and entirely compelling argument
has been given for assuming its general validity, Piron [1964, 1976]
and others (e.g., Beltrametti and Cassinelli [1981] and Guz [1980])
have derived the covering law from assumptions about the way in which
measurement results warrant inference from an initial state to a final
state. Here is a brief sketch of how this argument goes. Suppose that
there is some reasonable way to define, for an initial state
q of the system, represented by an atom of the logic/property
lattice L, a final state
p(q)
-- either another atom, or perhaps 0 -- conditional on the
proposition p having been confirmed. Various arguments can be
adduced suggesting that the only reasonable candidate for such a
mapping is the Sasaki projection
p : L
L, defined by
p(q) =
(q p)
p.[15]
It can be shown that an atomic OML satisfies the atomic covering law
just in case Sasaki projections take atoms again to atoms, or to 0.
Another interesting view of the covering law is developed by Cohen and
Svetlichny [1987].
,).
A very straightforward approach to constructing a "classical
interpretation" of
(,)
would begin by trying to embed
in a Borel test space
, with the
hope of then accounting for the statistical states in
as averages over "hidden" classical -- that is, dispersion-free
-- states on the latter. Thus, we'd want to find a set
S and a mapping X
(S)
assigning to each outcome x of
a set x*
S
in such a way that, for each test
E
,
{x* |
x E}
forms a partition of S. If this can be done, then each
outcome x of
simply records the fact that the system is in
one of a certain set of states, namely, x*. If we let
be the -algebra of
sets generated by sets of the form
{x* |
x X},
we find that each probability measure
on pulls back to a
state * on
, namely,
*(x) =
(x*). So long as every state
in
is of this form, we may claim to have given a completely classical
interpretation of the model
(,).
The minimal candidate for S is the set of all
dispersion-free states on . Setting
x* =
{sS |
s(x) = 1}
gives us a classical interpretation as above, which I'll call
the classical image of
. Any other classical interpretation
factors through this one. Notice, however, that the mapping x
x* is injective only if there are sufficiently many
dispersion-free states to separate distinct outcomes of
. If
has no dispersion-free states at all, then its classical
image is empty. Gleason's theorem tells us that this is
the case for quantum-mechanical models. Thus, this particular kind of
classical explanation is not available for quantum mechanical models.
does have a separating set of dispersion-free states, there may exist
statistical states on
that can not be realized as mixtures
of these. The classical image provides no explanation for such
states. For a very simple example of this sort of thing, consider the
the test space:
and the state
(a) =
(b)
=
(c) = ½,
(x) =
(y) =
(z) = 0.
It is a simple exercise to show that
cannot be expressed as a weighted average of {0,1}-valued states on
. For further examples and discussion of this
point, see Wright [1980].]
semi-classical if its tests do not overlap; i.e., if E
F
= Ø for
E, F
, with
E
F.
6.1 Lemma:
Let
As long as
is locally countable (i.e., no test E in
is uncountable), every state can be represented as a convex
combination, in a suitable sense, of extreme states [Wilce,
1992]. Thus, every state of a locally countable semi-classical test
space has a classical interpretation.
Even though neither Borel test spaces nor quantum test spaces are
semi-classical, one might argue that in any real laboratory situation,
semi-classicality is the rule. Ordinarily, when one writes down in
one's laboratory notebook that one has performed a given test and
obtained a given outcome, one always has a record of which test was
performed. Indeed, given any test space
,
we may always form a semi-classical test space simply by forming the
co-product (disjoint union) of the tests in
.
More formally:
6.2 Definition:
For each test E in
= {E~ | E
We can regard
as arising from
by deletion of the record of which test was performed to secure a
given outcome. Note that every state on
defines a state
on
by
(x,E)
= (x).
The mapping
is plainly injective; thus, we may identify the state-space of
with a subset of the state-space of
.
Notice that there will typically be many states on
that do not descend to states on
.
We might wish to think of these as "non-physical", since they do not
respect the (presumably, physically motivated) outcome-identifications
whereby
is defined.
Since it is semi-classical,
admits a classical interpretation, as per Lemma 7.1. Let's
examine this. An element of
S()
amounts to a mapping f :
X, assigning to each test
E
, an outcome
f(E)
E. This is a (rather brutal) example of what is meant by a
contextual (dispersion-free) hidden variable. The
construction above tells us that such contextual hidden variables will
be available for statistical models quite generally. For other results
to the same effect, see Kochen and Specker [1967], Gudder [1970],
Holevo [1982], and, in a different direction, Pitowsky
[1989].[16]
Note that the simple random variables on
correspond exactly to the
simple random variables on
,
and that these, in turn, correspond to some of the simple
random variables (in the usual sense) on the measurable space
S().
Thus, we have the following picture: The model
(,)
can always be obtained from a classical model simply by omitting some
random variables, and identifying outcomes that can no longer be
distinguished by those that remain.
All of this might suggest that our generalized probability theory presents no significant conceptual departure from classical probability theory. On the other hand, models constructed along the foregoing lines have a distinctly ad hoc character. In particular, the set of "physical" states in one of the classical (or semi-classical) models constructed above is determined not by any independent physical principle, but only by consistency with the original, non-semiclassical model. Another objection is that the contextual hidden variables introduced in this section are badly non-local. It is by now widely recognized that this non-locality is the principal locus of non-classicality in quantum (and more general) probability models. (For more on this, see the entry on the Bell inequalities.)
5 denote the test space
{{a,x,b}, {b,y,c}, {c,z,d}, {d,w,e}, {e,v,s}}
consisting of five three-outcome tests pasted together in a loop. This
test space is by no means pathological; it is both ortho-coherent and
algebraic. Moreover, it admits a separating set of dispersion-free
states and hence, a classical interpretation. Now consider how we
might model a compound system consisting of two separated sub-systems
each modeled by
5.
We would need to construct a test space
and a mapping
: X × X
Y =
satisfying, minimally, the following;
X,
if xy, then
xz
yz
and
zx
zy,
,
(5),
there exists at least one state
on
such that
(xy)
=
(x)(y),
for all outcomes
x, y X.
Foulis and Randall show that no such embedding exists for which
is orthocoherent.
The thrust of these no-go results is that straightforward constructions of plausible models for composite systems destroy regularity conditions (ortho-coherence in the case of the Foulis-Randall result, orthomodularity and the covering law in that of Aerts' result) that have widely been used to underwrite reconstructions of the usual quantum-mechanical formalism. This puts in doubt whether any of these conditions can be regarded as having the universality that the most optimistic version of Mackey's programme asks for. Of course, this does not rule out the possibility that these conditions may yet be motivated in the case of especially simple physical systems.
| Alexander Wilce wilce@susqu.edu |
